[1.] In Albert of Saxony’s introductory remarks regarding the exceptive term "tantum" in his Perutilis Logica we read this definition of the term "abstractio": "Abstractio est dubitabilium propositionum collectio (An abstraction is a collection of puzzling propositions)" (Erfurt ms., Amploniana, Cod. Q 242, f. 33v). This section of Albert’s treatise is not edited in the 1518 Venice edition. The only other known treatise from the Middle Ages with the title "Abstractiones" is that of a certain Hervaeus Sophista, edited in de Libera 1986. The term "abstractio", then, seems to refer to a "collection" of sophisms, perhaps with some emphasis upon the "excerpted" nature of such a collection. Indeed, the collection of Hervaeus consists of some 298 sophisms within a space of a mere five folios. Richard considers some 305 sophisms within a space of almost thirty folios in the Digby 24 manuscript.

[2.] De Rijk 1962-67, Vol. II, pt 1., 62-85 and 444-447.

[3.] For a description of manuscripts B, D, O, P and R see de Rijk 1962-67. De Rijk was unaware of manuscripts C and K. For a brief description of the C manuscript, see P.O. Lewry, "Oxford Logic 1250-1275: Nicholas and Peter of Cornwall," in Lewry 1985, 22. For additional descriptions of these manuscripts, see Raedts 1987, 107-111.

[4.] Ebbesen 1987, 136 and Lewry 1985. The manuscript is dated 1295, but Lewry remarks that the author uses the example "Henricus est rex Angliae", and Henry died in 1272. Thus the reference to the Magister Abstractionum could be as early as the 1270’s.

[5.] De Rijk 1986: 27.

[6.] William of Ockham, Summa Logicae, ed. Philotheus Boehner, Gideon Gál, and Stephen Brown (St. Bonaventure, N.Y. 1974), 367. Although this appears to be the only place where Ockham refers explicitly to the Magister Abstractionum, the editors point to other places where they believe he clearly has the Magister in mind (e.g., Summa Logicae III-1, c.16, 405; II, c. 4, 262). For references in Campsall, John of Reading and Adam Wodeham, see the Introduction to the Summa Logicae, 51*, n. 17.

[7.] The setting up of "contexts (casus)" within which proponents and opponents were obliged to develop their respective arguments gave rise to a special genre of sophism literature called "obligationes". We note the techniques of "obligatio" especially in the development of sophisms towards the end of the Abstractiones. For a discussion of the historical development of obligations, see Stump 1982 and Spade 1982.

[8.] De Rijk 1962-67, Vol. II, 71.

[9.] Pinborg 1976, 1-4.

[10.] The text of this question can be found in Franz Pelster, "Der Oxforder Theologie Richardus Rufus O.F.M. über die Frage, ‘Utrum Christus in triduo mortis fuerit homo’", Recherches de Théologie Ancienne et Médiévale, 16 (1949), 259-280. For Bacon’s discussion, see Thomas S. Maloney (ed. & tr.), Roger Bacon, Compendium of the Study of Theology, Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters 20, (Leiden: E. J. Brill, 1988), par. 86-101.

[11.] The distinction can be found in Norman Kretzmann (tr.), William of Sherwood’s Introduction to Logic, (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1966), 125-126, and Kretzmann (tr.), William of Sherwood’s Treatise on Syncategorematic Words, (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1968), 92-93.

[12.] Braakhuis 1981, 145-149.

[13.] Raedts 1987, 113 ff.