Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Notes to Étienne Bonnot de Condillac
Notes
1. Condillac's argument for
the immateriality of the soul is a version of an argument that Kant
dubbed "the Achilles of all rationalist inferences in the pure
doctrine of the soul." Versions can be found in the works of a number
of other early modern philosophers, including Mendelssohn and Bayle,
and it was often invoked by those attacking Locke's notorious
suggestion that God could have endowed matter with the capacity of
thought. As Condillac presented it, the argument proceeds by
establishing that thought could not be attributed to an extended
being, and so must be the property of an unextended and hence
immaterial substance. To establish this point Condillac observed that
any extended being is composed of parts that exist outside of one
another and that therefore can be separated from one another.
Consequently, any extended substance is actually a composite of many
independently existing substances. Were thought attributed to such a
being, it would either have to be attributed to these substances
individually (in which case each substance would have its own copy of
the thought) or collectively (in which case the one thought would be
divided up among the substances). But neither option is elligible.
Condillac did not bother to give an explicit reason for rejecting the
first. Presumably he supposed that it is too extravagant, insofar as
it needlessly multiplies the number of substances that are supposed
to have the thought, and that it conceeds the case, insofar as it
allows that thought can only occur in an indivisible substance. He
did, however, give explicit reasons for rejecting the second
possibility: Thoughts may themselves be taken to be either simple or
compound. Simple thoughts can, ipso facto not be divided
into parts and so cannot be parceled out among a number of
substances. Compound thoughts can be divided into their simple
components, but were these components parceled out to a number of
substances, each substance would only know the component alotted to
it, and none would know the whole that they add up to. The fact that
we do know the whole of a compound thought thus suggests that this
thought is grasped by something that is itself simple and
indivisible, and hence immaterial.
This argument was subjected to devastating criticism by Hume in Book
I, Part iv, Section 5 of his Treatise, and Condillac's
ignorance of Hume’s objections (which were so serious and so
directly opposed to Condillac's argument that he could hardly have
ignored them had he been aware of their existence) strongly suggests
that he had no knowledge of Hume's Treatise.
2. The one positive
suggestion Condillac had to make about how the mind might acquire
information about distance outwards was undeveloped and offered only
incidentally, in the process of replying to an objection. He
suggested that we might acquire information about distance outwards
from the number of intervening objects lying along the ground between
ourselves and a distant object (Essay I.vi. §10). This
is hardly a satisfactory alternative. Either it begs the question, by
presupposing that the intervening objects are seen one behind the
other (as opposed to one above the other), or it gives up the point,
by allowing that we do not immediately see depth but instead infer it
from features of what is actually only a two-dimensional display, in
which objects along the ground are seen at increasingly smaller
distances below the horizon, and so only as above and below one
another.
Copyright © 2002 by
Lorne Falkenstein
lfalkens@uwo.ca
First published: October 17, 2002
Content last modified: October 17, 2002