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A More Complex Example: A Supplement to Frege's Logic, Theorem, and Foundations for Arithmetic

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Frege's Logic, Theorem, and Foundations for Arithmetic


A More Complex Example

Example of an Inference Using the Definition of Membership

If given the premise that
1 + 22 = 5
one can prove that
1 ( + 22 = 5)
For it follows from our premise (by -Abstraction) that:
[z z + 22 = 5]1
Independently, by the logic of identity, we know:
([z z + 22 = 5])   =   ([z z + 22 = 5])
So we may conjoin this fact and the result of -Abstraction to produce:
([z z + 22 = 5]) = ([z z + 22 = 5])   &   [z z + 22 = 5]1
Then, by existential generalization on the concept [z z + 22 = 5], it follows that:
G[([z z + 22 = 5]) = G   &   G1]
By the definition of membership, we obtain:
1 ([z z + 22 = 5])
And, finally, by our Rewrite Rule, we establish what we set out to prove:
1 ( + 22 = 5)

Return to Frege's Logic, Theorem, and Foundations for Arithmetic

Copyright © 1998 by
Edward N. Zalta
zalta@stanford.edu

First published: June 10, 1998
Content last modified: May 9, 2002