Table of Contents
| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
|
how to cite |
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy |
content revised
|
However, characterizing imagery in this way (as explanans rather than explanandum) begs important questions about the nature of the mind and about the causes of imagery experiences (conceivably they are not experiences of cognitive processes or underlying representations). On the other hand, it should be admitted that defining imagery as a form of experience, is also problematic, and might deflect attention away from the possibility that importantly similar underlying representations or mechanisms may be operative both when we experience imagery and during certain unconscious mental processes (some evidence suggests that this is so). To avoid such problems we might replace "imagery" with some special jargon: we could speak of "quasi-perceptual experiences" on the one hand and "image representations (or processes)" on the other. However, this is not an established convention, and using these terms exclusively throughout this entry would seriously complicate discussion of the views of those thinkers (probably the vast majority) who fail to disentangle these notions. Thus, the (more or less) ordinary language term "imagery" will continue to be used where appropriate.
But our initial definition of "imagery" may well be thought unsatisfactory even in its own terms. Not only does it duck the difficult task of specifying what dimensions and degrees of similarity to perception are necessary for an experience to count as imagery; it also elides the controversial question of whether imagery is a sui generis phenomenon, conceptually quite distinct from true perceptual experience despite the surface resemblance, or whether it is more appropriately regarded as lying at one end of a continuum stretching from ordinary veridical perception at one end, to ‘pure’ imagery, where the character of the experience seems to be quite independent of any current stimulus input, at the other. In between would come cases, often held to be due to the effects of imagination, where the character of the experience seems to be only partially determined by the character of the current stimulus: both mistaken or illusive perception and non-deceptive seeing as (such as seeing the notorious duck-rabbit figure as a duck [or rabbit], or, for example, "seeing" the shapes of animals, or whatever, in the clouds or constellations). Many philosophers and cognitive theorists implicitly take this line, treating percepts as, essentially, special cases of imagery, differing only in causal history and, perhaps, "vivacity". For example: for Descartes (in the Treatise on Man) both images and percepts are ultimately embodied as pictures picked out on the surface of the pineal gland by the flow of animal spirits; for Kosslyn (1994) both are depictive representations in the brain's "visual buffer"; for Hinton (1979) both are "structural descriptions" in working memory. However, other theorists (e.g. Sartre, 1936) try to draw a sharp conceptual and phenomenological distinction between perceptual and imaginal experience.
But in the absence of consensus about such issues, or about the underlying mechanisms and the psychological functions of imagery, our initial rough characterization is probably about the best we can do without begging important questions. Perhaps it is sufficient. Imagery is a common, everyday phenomenon that is indicated by a whole range of colloquial expressions: "having a picture in the head", "picturing", "visualizing", "having/seeing a mental image/picture", "seeing in the mind's eye", and, in some contexts, simply "imagining". Although a small percentage of people seem inclined to deny ever experiencing it, for the vast majority of us, our imagery, like our consciousness itself, is something with which we seem to be thoroughly familiar and intimate.
However, the term "mental imagery", and all the colloquial equivalents mentioned above, may be potentially misleading in itself. For one thing, all these expressions suggest, more or less strongly, a purely visual phenomenon. In fact, most discussions of imagery, in the past and today, have indeed focused upon the visual mode. Nevertheless, there is every reason to believe that other modes of quasi-perceptual experience are just as common and important (Newton, 1982), and "imagery" has come to be the accepted scientific term for referring to them too: interesting studies of "auditory imagery", "kinaesthetic imagery", "haptic (touch) imagery", and so forth, can be found in the contemporary psychological literature.
A related, and perhaps a more serious problem with the term "imagery" and with most of the colloquial alternatives is that they strongly suggest that the phenomenon involves some sort of picture (the image) entering into or being created in the mind. Indeed, this theoretical story seems to have gone virtually unquestioned during past ages (which may explain how the terminology in question became entrenched), and probably remains the majority, lay and expert, view today. Nevertheless, during this century it has come under strong challenge, and can no longer be regarded as uncontroversial. The confusions arising from this (as well as the other ambiguities of the term "imagery" that we have mentioned) continue to bedevil discussions of the topic. In particular, people who deny the existence of mental pictures seem frequently to be misunderstood as (implausibly) denying the occurrence of quasi-perceptual experiences, and in some cases they may themselves come to believe that the first denial commits them to the second (Thomas, 1989). Indeed, there is some reason to think (although it is certainly not established) that that minority of people (about 10% of the population by some estimates) who deny ever experiencing imagery, or who deny that it plays any significant role in their mental lives, may simply be understanding the terminology in a somewhat idiosyncratic fashion: what they intend to deny may not be so much that they have quasi-perceptual experience, but, rather, that what they do have is predominantly visual, or that it involves inner pictures, or that it resembles perceptual experience to the extent that they (perhaps wrongly) understand other people to be claiming for their imagery (or some combination of these claims). This is a theoretically important issue because if it is true that some people really do not experience any imagery then imagery (understood as experience rather than representation) cannot play the vital role in mental life that has very often been attributed to it.
On a more consensual note, with only rare exceptions (e.g. Wright, 1983) nearly all serious discussions of imagery take it for granted (explicitly or implicitly) that it exhibits intentionality (i.e. imagery is normally of something or other, in the same sense that perception is perception of something), and that it is, for the most part, subject to conscious control. Although images often come into the mind unbidden, and sometimes it is hard to shake off unwanted imagery (say, of the horrible accident that one cannot get out of one's mind) in general one can conjure-up, manipulate, and dismiss images at will. In this regard, imagery appears as an unequivocally mental phenomenon, quite distinct from other quasi-perceptual experiences, such as after-images and phosphenes (Oster, 1970), that are not subject to direct conscious control, and which are probably best explained in straightforwardly physiological terms. It is also distinguished from cognitive and representational, but nevertheless unconscious and automatic functions such as the postulated high capacity but very short term visual memory store known as "iconic memory" (Neisser, 1967). On the other hand, so called eidetic imagery, if, indeed, it exists at all as a distinct phenomenon (see Haber, 1979, and the appended commentaries), is probably best understood as a species of mental imagery proper, despite the fact that it is characterized by a vividness, detailed articulation, and stability that far exceed what most normal subjects seem to want to claim for their imagery experiences.
It may also be worth pointing out that mental imagery should be distinguished from "imagery" as the term has come to be used in a literary context, where it seems to refer to a linguistic trope that employs highly concrete, perceptually specific language in order to evoke certain emotions or otherwise convey some more abstract and elusive underlying sense. Very likely, literary imagery originally got its name from a supposed power of the words in question to induce mental imagery in a reader, and some contemporary literary critics defend such an interpretation (Esrock, 1994; Scarry, 1999), but it is surely not the case that the expression is now universally, or even generally, understood this way.
For the late 19th century researchers who established psychology as an empirical scientific discipline, mental images (usually, in English, referred to as ideas) held just the same central place in the explanation of cognition that they had held for philosophical psychologists of earlier times. However, developments within psychology at the beginning of the 20th century began to cast doubt on this long established consensus. A group of psychologists working in Würzburg, Germany claimed to have found empirical evidence for conscious thought contents that were not imaginal or perceptual in character. Their results were challenged on several grounds, and were certainly never definitively established. Nevertheless, the bitter dispute that ensued, the so called imageless thought controversy, had a profound effect on the development of psychology as a science (and, I would argue, on philosophy also). Most psychologists became, in effect, profoundly disillusioned with the notion of mental imagery, and either avoided seriously considering the topic, treated it dismissively, or, in some extreme cases, denied the existence of the phenomenon outright. These attitudes noticeably influenced other disciplines, including philosophy. Although the psychological study of imagery revived with the rise of cognitivism in the 1960s and 70s, when new experimental techniques were developed that enabled a truly experimental study of the phenomenon, current views about, and attitudes towards, mental imagery cannot be properly understood without an awareness of this history, versions of which, of varying degrees of accuracy, have passed into the folklore of psychology.
When psychology first began to emerge as an experimental science, in the philosophy departments of the German universities in the late 19th century, the central role of imagery in mental life was not in question. Wilhelm Wundt, acclaimed "the father of experimental psychology", established the first psychological research and teaching laboratory in the Leipzig Philosophy Department in around 1876 (Fancher, 1996). He regarded his psychology as a branch of philosophy, an attempt to apply the experimental method of natural science (particularly, the physiology of Helmholtz) to essentially philosophical problems concerning the nature of mind and its metaphysical status. This view of the subject persisted, in Germany, at least until the Nazi era. Wundt's research program aimed to investigate the "elements of consciousness," and the laws governing the combination of these elements (Wundt, 1912). Although his theoretical system made a place for emotional feelings as one class of element, in practice the main focus of Wundt's experimentally based research program was on the elements of sensation and their compounding into ideas. As has been the case in the empiricist philosophical tradition, these ideas were conceived of as, to all intents and purposes, mental images. Indeed, Wundt insists, much in the spirit of Hume, that there is no fundamental difference in kind between the ideas arising directly from perception and "memory images" (Wundt, 1912). Thus, Wundtian experimental psychology was largely a study of cognitive processes, and, for him (and most of his numerous students and imitators), the mental image (under the rubric idea) played essentially the same crucial, representational role in cognition that it had played for most of his philosophical predecessors.
Wundt's American counterpart, and contemporary, William James, took a not dissimilar view, although he was careful to acknowledge that in some people the "thought stuff," as he called it, might consist not so much of visual imagery as of imagery of other modes, especially the "verbal images" of inner speech (James, 1890 ch. 18). In his textbook The Principles of Psychology (1890) James has much that is insightful to say about psychological processes in general, and about the role of imagery in them in particular, but, although he carried out experimental demonstrations in his psychology teaching at Harvard, James had little interest in the actual pursuit of experimental research, and established no graduate teaching program in experimental psychology (Fancher, 1996). Thus, despite the lucidity of his justly famous text, and the wide readership it has continued to find, his direct influence on the disciplinary development of scientific psychology, even in his native America, probably never equaled that of Wundt (or even lesser German pioneers, such as G.E. Müller), who trained many Americans (as well as many Germans, and students of other nationalities) in the techniques of experimental research. Just around this time, when psychology was the latest intellectual fashion, the American Universities were undergoing a tremendous expansion. Thus many of these students were able to return from Germany to the United States to found experimental psychology teaching programs of their own. It was because of this, much more than the intellectual influence of James, that, well before it grew into a dominant world power and achieved its current leadership in the sciences generally, the U.S.A. quickly grew to rival, and eventually surpass, Germany's initial preeminence in scientific psychology.
Although psychologists of this era have often been portrayed (notably by Boring (1950)) as using an introspective methodology, in fact Wundt, in particular, was very sensitive to standard criticisms of introspection, such as the contention that the very attempt to observe our own mental activities will itself alter them. He thus limited its use to situations where he was satisfied that the causes of the relevant mental events, the experimental stimuli, could be strictly controlled and the results shown to be replicable, with any introspective reports being made unreflectively, as soon as the relevant content appeared in the mind (Mischel, 1970; Danziger, 1980). Wundt's research did not rely upon discursive descriptions of mental contents. An "introspective" report in his laboratory might typically have involved no more than indicating the moment when a certain sensation entered consciousness, or saying whether a musical tone seemed higher or lower than the one presented just before. Such "introspective reports" differ little from the sorts of responses that might be called for in a modern cognitive psychology experiment. Wundt's methodological discipline meant that the data collected in his laboratory were primarily such things as reaction times or discrimination thresholds, rather than discursive introspective reports; it also meant, in practice, that his experiments were restricted almost entirely to the study of "lower" psychological processes, principally sensation and perception. Thus, although Wundt did hold that "higher" mental process, such as thought and memory, depended largely upon mental images (including verbal imagery, silent speech), in practice his experimental work did little directly to illuminate these. "Higher" mental processes, for Wundt, were best investigated non-experimentally, via a methodology that he called völkerpsychologie, a hermeneutic study of cultural products to which he devoted much of his later career, but which never achieved anything like the influence of his experimentally based work.
An Englishman, Edward B. Titchener, became one of Wundt's most influential students. After graduate studies with Wundt, Titchener moved to the United States and became professor of Psychology at Cornell, where, as well as being responsible for translating many of the more experimentally oriented works of Wundt into English, he established a successful graduate school and a vigorous research program (Tweney, 1987). Despite the fact that Wundt's and Titchener's philosophical and theoretical views, and their scientific methodologies, differed in important ways (Leahey, 1981), Titchener, much more than most of his American born colleagues, shared Wundt's vision of psychology as a pure science, with essentially philosophical rather than pragmatic ends, and he gained the reputation of being Wundt's leading disciple and representative in the English speaking world. However, he had no interest in his master's völkerpsychologie. Titchener had been deeply influenced by positivist optimism as to the scope of science, and he hoped to study even the "higher" thought processes experimentally (Danziger, 1979, 1980). Thus he attempted to push the method of controlled laboratory introspection far beyond the bounds that Wundt had so carefully set for it.
Titchener appears to have been both a particularly vivid imager, and a firm believer in imagery's cognitive importance. He had studied British Empiricist philosophy whilst an undergraduate at Oxford, and was well aware of Berkeley's argument that "general ideas" (i.e. mental images that, in-and-of-themselves, represent a kinds or categories of things, rather than particulars) are inconceivable. Berkeley argues that, for instance, the general idea of a triangle, which would need to be:
neither oblique nor rectangle, neither equilateral, equicrural, nor scalenon, but all and none of these at once. In effect it is something imperfect that cannot exist, an idea wherein some parts of several different and inconsistent ideas are put together. (Berkeley, 1734).Many philosophers take Berkeley's argument to amount to a knock-down refutation of the traditional theory -- first articulated by Aristotle (De Interpretatione 16a; De Anima 420b), and reiterated by Locke (1700) -- that images (ideas) are the primary vehicles of thought and that they ground linguistic meaning. If mental images can only, intrinsically represent particulars (as Berkeley, relying on the empiricist view of the nature of imagery as consisting of copies or fading echoes of sensory impressions, argued) then they are surely inadequate for grounding the meanings of the general, categorical terms that are fundamental to thought. However, Titchener, on introspective grounds, flatly rejected Berkeley's claim:
But I can quite well get . . . the triangle that is no triangle at all and all triangles at one and the same time. It is a flashy thing, come and gone from moment to moment: it hints two or three red angles, with the red lines deepening into black, seen on a dark green ground. It is not there long enough to say whether the angles join to form the complete figure, or even whether all three of the necessary angles are given. Nevertheless, it means triangle; it is Locke's general idea of a triangle; (Titchener, 1909).
Of course, Titchener was well aware that the image described here was thoroughly idiosyncratic. However, he did want to claim that such images (in virtue not so much of their individual, intrinsic characteristics, but of their place in a whole associative network of imagery) do carry meaning, and are thus fitted to be the vehicles of thought. He also described examples of his own visualizations of abstract concepts (such as the concept of meaning itself: "the blue-grey tip of a kind of scoop … digging into a dark mass of what appears to be plastic material") and even claimed to experience imaginal meanings of connectives such as but (Titchener, 1909). Titchener plainly held that (together with actual sensation) mental content is mental imagery.
Titchener's theories, and, to a very large extent, the introspection based experimental methods he used to test and refine them, have long since fallen into disrepute. (By contrast, Wundt's reputation has seen a considerable revival in recent decades (e.g. Blumenthal, 1975; Bringman & Tweney, 1980; Fancher, 1996).) However, one series of experiments carried out in Titchener's laboratory, by his student C.W. Perky (1910), has achieved something of a classic status in the literature on imagery. Perky asked her subjects to fixate a point on a screen in front of them and to visualize various objects there, such as a tomato, a book, a leaf, a banana, an orange, or a lemon. As the subjects did this, and unbeknownst to them, a faint patch of color, of an appropriate size and shape, and just above the normal threshold of visibility, was back projected (in soft focus) onto the screen. Apart from on a couple of occasions when the projection apparatus was mishandled, none of Perky's subjects (ranging from a ten year old child to her colleagues, the trained and experienced introspectors of Titchener's laboratory) ever realized that they were experiencing real percepts; they took what they "saw" on the screen to be entirely the products of their imagination. In fact, however, the projections did influence their experiences: some subjects expressed surprise at finding themselves imagining a banana "upright" rather than the horizontally oriented one they had been trying for; one was surprised to wind up imagining an elm leaf after trying for a maple. On the other hand, purely imaginary details were also reported: One subject could "see" the veins of the leaf; another claimed that the title on the imagined book was readable.
Perky's results have been read as evidence that imagery may be systematically confused with genuine visual experience, that images and percepts, as Hume believed, differ subjectively in, at most, only their degree of "vivacity" or vividness. However we should note that the projected color patches were clearly visible as such to people who were not under instructions to form an image (Perky, 1910). Furthermore, Segal (1971b) reports that when she initially tried to replicate the "Perky effect" with "the suspicious, pragmatic students who populated our campuses in the late 1950s and early 1960s," they quickly saw through the deception. Eventually, she achieved better replications by taking steps to induce a state of relaxation in her subjects (Segal & Nathan, 1964). Several subjects, for example, asked to imagine a New York skyline whilst a faint image of a tomato was projected on the screen, reported imagining New York at sunset (Segal, 1972). Nevertheless, Segal concludes, from her extensive experimental studies over many years, that the Perky effect arises not so much from the indistinguishability of mental images and (faint) percepts, as from the fact that the effort to form an image, under certain circumstances, interferes with the normal course of perception and raises perceptual detection thresholds (Segal, 1971b; Segal & Fusella, 1971).
Perhaps Wundt's most important German student was Oswald Külpe, who had for several years served as Wundt's assistant professor, but eventually left to set up his own laboratory in the philosophy department of Würzburg University. He and his students there developed a direct challenge to the prevalent imagery theory of thought. Under the influence of both Machian positivism and, later, the act psychology of Brentano and the phenomenology of Husserl, Külpe, like Titchener (whom he had helped train), rejected what he saw as Wundt's unnecessarily strict methodological restrictions on the scope of empirical science, and encouraged his students to extend the scope of the introspective "experimental" method to the study of the "higher" processes of thought and reasoning (Danziger, 1979, 1980; Ash, 1998). In 1901, two of these students, Mayer and Orth, performed a word association experiment in which subjects were asked to report everything that had passed through their mind between hearing the stimulus word and giving the response. Note that it was normal practice, in this era of psychology, for experimental subjects, or "observers" as they were often called, to be drawn from among fellow researchers within the same laboratory, often including the supervising professor. Present day psychologists would, with good reason, suspect such subjects of being liable to produce results strongly biased by theoretical preconceptions (Orne, 1962; Intons-Peterson, 1983). Great pains are usually taken, today, to ensure that subjects in psychological experiments have no idea what hypothesis the experiment is supposed to be testing. In 1901 however, it was thought that experienced and knowledgeable "observers" were more likely to produce consistent and meaningful results than the psychologically untrained. In the case of the Meyer and Orth experiment, two amongst the four subjects were Meyer and Orth themselves. Nevertheless, they professed to be surprised by some of their findings. In particular:
The subjects frequently reported that they experienced certain events of consciousness which they could quite clearly designate neither as definite images nor yet as volitions. For example, the subject Meyer made the observation that, in reference to the stimulus word "metre" a peculiar event of consciousness intervened which could not be characterized more exactly, and which was succeeded by the spoken response "trochee".The jargon term bewusstseinslagen ("states of consciousness" -- Humphrey, 1951) was coined to designate these indescribable non-sensorial states, and they soon began to turn up in more and more profusion in the introspective reports generated in the Würzburg laboratory, taking on an increasing theoretical significance as time went by. In 1905 another Würzburg researcher, Ach, also introduced the largely overlapping, but more explicitly intentionalistic concept of bewusstheit or "awareness", an unanalysable "impalpably given ’knowing’" (Ach, quoted and translated by Humphrey, 1951), and by 1907, Karl Bühler, perhaps the most radical of Külpe's students, was simply referring to gedanken ("thoughts"). Bühler's experiments might, for example, involve giving a subject (often professor Külpe himself) a somewhat gnomic sentence to interpret (e.g. "Thinking is so extraordinarily difficult that many prefer to judge.") and then collecting introspective reports of the conscious, but allegedly non-imaginal, gedanken that had occurred between the hearing of the sentence and the giving of the interpretation. Although the Würzburg school never denied that imagery does occur, by this time the greater part of the conscious contents of minds examined in Würzburg seemed to be non-imaginal.
(Meyer & Orth, as quoted and translated by Humphrey, 1951)
Unsurprisingly, Wundt, and others, refused to accept these new methods and conclusions, and a heated debate, the so called imageless thought controversy, ensued. Though Wundt was surely skeptical of the existence of imageless thoughts, his primary criticisms were methodological. He was very much concerned with the fact that the experiments were necessarily constructed so that the introspective reports were given after the completion of the experimental task (word association, sentence interpretation, or whatever). The Würzburg research thus involved discursive recollection (or was it reconstruction?) of conscious contents that were no longer present to the mind. Such experiments, Wundt argued, were open invitations to suggestion, and, indeed, were
not experiments at all in the sense of scientific methodology: they are counterfeit experiments that seem methodical simply because they are ordinarily performed in a psychological laboratory and involve the coöperation of two persons, who purport to be experimenter and observer. In reality, they are as unmethodical as possible; they possess none of the special features by which we distinguish the introspections of experimental psychology from the casual introspections of everyday life. (Wundt, quoted and translated by Titchener, 1909. Original German, 1907.)
Titchener also strongly objected to the imageless thought demonstrations, but for different reasons. He did not object to the aims or the introspective methodology of the Würzburg school, but to their purported results, and, for him, the experiments were not so much misconceived as incompetently executed: In particular, he felt, the "observers" (experimental subjects) in Würzburg had been inadequately trained in the art of introspection. According to Titchener, the main pitfall of introspection was what he called the "stimulus error," the strong tendency to confound the conscious experience itself with whatever it might represent: Thus, to report, when looking at a rectangular table top, that one experiences a rectangle, would be to commit the stimulus error: The "real" conscious content would (on Titchener's view) have the trapezoidal shape that the table top projects upon the retina. For Titchener, the intentionality generally ascribed to imageless thoughts only showed that the Würzburg introspectors were systematically committing the stimulus error: They were not reporting the intrinsic nature of their conscious contents, but what those contents signified. Titchener suggested that the purported bewusstseinslagen etc. were, in fact, faint and fleeting kinaesthetic sensations, feelings of muscular tension and the like (Tweney, 1987). In his laboratory, experiments quite similar to those done in Würzburg, but carried out using introspective "observers" well trained in avoiding the stimulus error (Titchener himself, or his own graduate students), produced no reports of imageless thoughts. Instead, they found the fleeting imagery or the subtle bodily sensations that Professor Titchener's theory predicted (Titchener, 1909; Humphrey, 1951).
This work of Titchener's (like other responses to the imageless thought controversy from America, Britain, and elsewhere) had relatively little impact in Germany, which, with some justification at that time, still regarded itself as very much preeminent in psychological science. Nevertheless, on both sides of the Atlantic the controversy was recognized as touching on deep foundational issues in the science of mind. Although largely forgotten today, it seems to have had a lasting impact on the development not only of psychology, but (especially in the German speaking world, where the fields were more closely intellectually and institutionally entwined) philosophy as well. The Würzburg school's claims, despite their shaky basis, undoubtedly contributed to a sense that imagery could not be so psychologically important as had traditionally been assumed, and that an alternative way of thinking about cognitive content was needed. Many psychologists and philosophers of this era came, partly for this reason, to feel that thought should be understood in terms of language per se, and that it was a serious mistake ever to have thought that the representational power of language derives from that of some more fundamental form of representation, such as mental imagery. Bloor (1983) goes so far as to suggest (though without citing any evidence) that the work of the later Wittgenstein largely grew out of the reaction to the imageless thought affair. Bloor may be overstating the case, but certainly a leading Würzburg alumnus, Karl Bühler, was established in Vienna during the inter-war years, and Wittgenstein is known to have met him there, and seems to have reacted strongly to his views (Toulmin, 1969; Bartley, 1973). Bühler also taught, and deeply influenced, the young Karl Popper (Popper, 1976), and undoubtedly his views would also have been quite familiar to the Vienna Circle positivists.
But the imageless thought controversy was never satisfactorily resolved, at least in the terms in which it was originally posed. Although the Würzburg school has been praised for drawing psychological attention to the intentionality of mental contents, and for the introduction of once important concepts such as "mental set" into psychology, it would certainly be grossly misleading to suggest that their work provides evidence for the existence of non-sensorial conscious mental contents (i.e. imageless thoughts) that comes anywhere close to meeting contemporary scientific standards. Indeed, the fact that Külpe's and Titchener's laboratories each produced results that fitted their directors' contrasting preconceptions did not go unnoticed by their contemporaries. The unresolvable debate contributed significantly to a growing sense of intellectual crisis within psychology, leading to a deep loss of confidence (persisting to the present) in the scientific value of introspection. It also led to a precipitous decline in scientific interest in imagery. On the one hand its importance in the cognitive economy was now subject to doubt; on the other hand it had come to seem that it was very difficult, if not impossible, to study it experimentally and objectively.
In Germany, some psychologists responded to this crisis by turning away from the experimental study of "cognitive" questions about the workings of the mind in general, and moved instead toward an understanding of their subject as concerned with interpretive studies of persons, or the differences between them. They, generally, became more interested in their subjects' dispositions, values, motives, etc. than in either their imagery (unless, perhaps, its contents were interestingly idiosyncratic) or their bewusstseinslagen (if any such existed) (Danziger, 1980).
An exception is the work of Jaensch (1930) on eidetic imagery (i.e. visual imagery that is experienced as before the eyes rather than "in the head," and that is unusually vivid and stable -- most evidence for the existence of eidetic imagery comes from studies of children, and it seems to be rare in adults (Haber, 1979)). However, although this work has not been without influence, and is not necessarily entirely devoid of scientific value, it is deeply tainted by Jaensch's enthusiasm for the Nazi racist ideology that was then taking hold in Germany. Eidetic imagery, he claims (on meager evidence), is characteristic of the less developed minds of not only children, but also members of "southern," "sun adapted" (i.e. darker skinned) races. (Jaensch later won notoriety for performing an experiment designed to show that "northern" chickens are racially superior -- as evidenced by more careful and intelligent pecking -- to "southern" ones (Ash, 1998).)
However, the idea that thought processes that rely upon visual imagery (as opposed to verbal thought) are characteristic of minds that are somehow defective or inferior is not confined to Nazi thinkers such as Jaensch in this era. Sigmund Freud (a Jew, who had to flee his native Austria to escape the Nazis) seems implicitly to have regarded visual images reported by his patients as part and parcel of their neuroses, as something to be exorcized and replaced by verbally mediated, "rational" insights (Esrock, 1994 ch. 3). This may well be related to the sensibility that Jay (1993) finds to be pervasive in 20th century French intellectual life, wherein visually based thought and experience is actively disvalued in comparison to other modes of sense experience, and verbally mediated thinking. Arguably, signs of a similar attitude are evident some decades earlier in England, in the responses Francis Galton received to his pioneering questionnaire about mental imagery vividness. Unlike the regular folk he questioned, many of the scientists and other intellectuals amongst Galton's respondents were distinctly unwilling to admit to ever experiencing mental imagery (Galton, 1880, 1883), a finding that more recent research has failed to reproduce (Roe, 1951; and see Ferguson, 1977, 1992; Shepard, 1978a,b; Deutsch, 1981; Miller, 1984). It is hard to say how widespread such attitudes were, or how they originated (or why they now seem to have faded), but they may well have contributed to the sharp decline in intellectual interest in imagery, apparent not only in psychology but also philosophy and literary studies, that is very apparent in the early decades of the 20th century (Esrock, 1994), and which, among philosophers and literary critics at any rate, has only quite recently shown signs of reversal (e.g. Rollins, 1989; Ellis, 1995; Scarry, 1999).
Many other German psychologists, in the wake of the imageless thought controversy, continued to adhere to the Wundtian ambition of developing an experimental science of the mind, and returned to something like the sort of methodological caution in the use of introspective reports that Wundt himself had advocated, often insisting on the direct corroboration of introspective evidence by observable effects on behavior (Danziger, 1980). This usually meant that, as with Wundt himself, although their experimentally based psychology did not explicitly repudiate the essential role traditionally assigned to imagery in thought and memory, in practice it had rather little to say about it. (Plausible behavioral correlates of imagery processes were not established until the rise of the cognitive psychology movement.)
Perhaps the most influential movement arising from this strand of German psychological thought was Gestalt Psychology. It was also perhaps the last German bred movement to make a major impact in the United States, where it became a sort of "official opposition" to the indigenous and dominant Behaviorism. This was facilitated by the fact that, under the pressure of the rising tide of German Naziism, a significant number of Gestalt Psychology's adherents -- including the acknowledged leaders, Max Wertheimer, Wolfgang Köhler, and Kurt Koffka -- emigrated to America during the 1920s and 30s (Ash, 1998). Gestalt Theory attempted to explain "higher" thought processes in terms of a sort of hypothetical neuroscience (field theory) rather than in terms of the vicissitudes of introspected thought contents (Thomas, 1987; Ash, 1998). Although the Gestalt psychologists were much concerned with the experimental investigation of subjective experience (from whence they sought most of the evidential support for their views), in practice this research focused almost entirely on perceptual experience. The typical Gestaltist experiment sought immediate, unreflective descriptions of the appearance of a carefully constructed stimulus (frequently complex and illusional), and preferentially used subjects naïve to the theoretical views and concerns of the experimenter. This was something very unlike the deliberate "looking within" practiced by the psychologically sophisticated, trained introspectors of Titchener's or Külpe's laboratories. In certain respects Gestalt psychology foreshadowed, and, indeed, importantly influenced, the cognitivist movement of recent decades (Gardner, 1987). Nevertheless, it had little directly to say about the nature or function of imagery.
Where the Gestalt Psychologists, for the most part, ignored the concept of imagery, the Behaviorist movement, which came to dominate American (and, eventually, international) scientific psychology for almost half a century, actively attacked it. To borrow a coinage from Dennett (1978), Behaviorist psychology was thoroughly iconophobic. Although the rapid rise of Behaviorism in the United States in the early years of the 20th century certainly had multiple causes, social and institutional as well as intellectual (O'Donnell, 1985), the imageless thought controversy, and the questions it raised about introspection as a viable scientific methodology, was certainly prominent amongst the intellectual causes. In the famous "manifesto" by which John B. Watson publicly launched Behaviorism as a self-conscious movement, the controversy over imageless thoughts is cited as the prime example (indeed, the only really explicit example) of the malaise of psychological methodology, for which Behaviorism would be the cure (Watson, 1913a). In a lengthy footnote to this paper, and in a follow-up article, Watson (1913b) cast doubt on the very existence of mental imagery, a position he was to state more forcefully in later work, where he stigmatized the concept (together with all other remotely mentalistic concepts) as a thoroughly unscientific, "medieval" notion, inextricably bound up with religious belief in an immortal soul, and, as such, barely one step away from "old wives tales" and the superstitions of "savagery" (Watson, 1930). He described personal reports of such things as memory images of one's childhood home as "sheer bunk," nothing more than the sentimental "dramatizing" of verbally mediated memories (i.e. conditioned tendencies to say certain things, either out loud or sub-vocally) (Watson, 1928).
Not all American psychologists, even overt Behaviorists, were quite as vehement as Watson in their denunciation of mentality in general, or imagery in particular, but his views certainly resonated with many. The publication of Watson's manifesto (1913a) had, in fact, been preceded by several less radical critiques of introspective methodology from other American psychologists (Danziger, 1980). Particularly relevant here is Knight Dunlap's "The Case Against Introspection" (1912), because Dunlap, who was a junior colleague of Watson in the Johns Hopkins University Psychology Department, seems to have played a crucial if inadvertent role in the formation of Watson's attitude towards imagery, and, thereby, in the crystallization of Behaviorism itself (Cohen, 1979; Thomas, 1989).
During his early days at Johns Hopkins (where he arrived in 1908) Watson, by his own account, believed that "centrally aroused visual sensations [i.e., images] were as clear as those peripherally aroused" (Watson, 1913a), and when Dunlap told Watson of his skepticism concerning what he (Dunlap) called "the old doctrine of images" Watson initially demurred, insisting that he himself made important use of visual imagery, for example in the process of designing experimental apparatus (Dunlap, 1932; cf. Watson, 1936).
However, by this time Watson already seems to have been ambitious to approach human psychology using the methodology that he had already successfully developed for the study of animal behavior (Watson, 1924, 1936). By 1910, and perhaps before, the only real factor preventing Watson from conceiving of the study of behavior as embracing the whole of psychology seems to have been "the problem of the higher thought processes" (Burnham, 1968): Thought was supposed to be carried on primarily in imagery, and imagery was not behavior (see Watson, 1913b). Dunlap's objections to the "old doctrine" that held visual imagery to consist in "centrally aroused visual sensations" seems to have played a crucial role in emboldening Watson to deny the existence of imagery altogether, thus enabling him to present the study of behavior as a fully sufficient methodology for psychology (Watson, 1924; Thomas, 1989).
However, Dunlap never became a Behaviorist himself (Dunlap, 1932), and when his actual views about imagery are examined (Dunlap, 1914) it becomes apparent that he did not intend to deny that people have experiences that are, in a significant sense, quasi-perceptual. Although he described himself as an "iconoclast" (1932), and held that "the image, as a copy or reproduction of sensation . . . does not exist," (Dunlap,1914), Dunlap also asserted that Watson went much too far in rejecting "imagination" as well as "images" (Dunlap, 1932), and he continued to hold that we are in need of an account of the nature of "ideas". Something, something mental and, indeed, quasi-perceptual, is needed to fill the functional role that images played in the traditional psychology of thinking. It is clear that he (unlike Watson) did not deny the existence of imagery in the sense in which it was defined at the beginning of this article (i.e. quasi-perceptual experience). Dunlap's theory would seem to be best understood as a pioneering (though perhaps, ultimately, unconvincing) attempt to explain both the experience of imagery, and the functional role that it plays in thinking, in a way that avoids postulating the presence of pictures in the head, or inner copies of former sense impressions.
According to Dunlap, ideas are actually complexes of muscular sensations, caused by outwardly imperceptible movements, or, at least, tensings, of the muscles, particularly (though not exclusively) the muscles associated with the sense organs themselves, such as those that move the eyes. Particular patterns of muscular response, Dunlap holds, occur during the perception of particular types of objects or events, and may be aroused not only in the course of the actual perception of a relevant object, but also through associative links with the sensations produced by other muscular response patterns appropriate to other sorts of objects or events. These latter patterns may have arisen in actual perception, or may themselves have been aroused associatively in a similar way. Thus, associative trains of thought can be sustained. When the muscular response is aroused associatively, rather than by the actual perceptual presence of the relevant object, we experience the idea, or image, of the object. Visual imagery consists not of copies or echoes of visual sensations, but rather of actual current sensations in the muscles involved in the process of seeing something.
There is indeed a present content essentially connected with imagination or thought; but this present content is in each case a muscle sensation, or a complex of muscle sensations. We are therefore, in investigating images, dealing not with copies, or pale ghosts, of former sensations but with actual present sensations. (Dunlap, 1914)These muscle sensations are, explicitly, not to be confused with the impalpable imageless thoughts of Würzburg, rather, "This sensation is the true image" (Dunlap, 1914, emphasis in original). (For a more extensive account of Dunlap's theory of imagery, and its influence on Watson, see Thomas (1989).)
Dunlap's theory of imagery/ideas was publicly presented only in one brief and rather obscurely published article (Dunlap, 1914) and (apart from its unintended and covert influence on Watson), it seems to have attracted very little interest from his contemporaries. The theory probably owes much to the influence of Hugo Münsterberg, whose "motor theory" of the mind had a considerable vogue amongst American psychologists at the time, but which was soon to be eclipsed by the rise of Behaviorism (Scheerer, 1984). Münsterberg was a German, a former student of Wundt, who had been hired to teach psychology at Harvard when William James moved on, and Dunlap had studied under him before coming to Johns Hopkins (Dunlap, 1932). An earlier "motor" theory of imagery can also be found in the work of the French psychologist Theodule Ribot (1890, 1900) (predating Münsterberg's influence), but the most developed version was surely that of Margaret Floy Washburn, a former student of Titchener. Washburn (unlike Dunlap) is quite open in acknowledging her intellectual debt to Münsterberg (Washburn, 1932), and her book Movement and Mental Imagery (Washburn, 1916) goes into considerable, if speculative, physiological as well as psychological detail. However, by the time this was published Behaviorist iconophobia was already taking firm hold, and Washburn's version of the motor theory of imagery seems to have failed to attract any more adherents than Dunlap's had.
Infamously, during the period of Behaviorist dominance, up until about 1960, mental imagery received minimal attention from scientific psychologists. According to Paivio (1971), the 1920s and 1930s were "the most arid period" for imagery research, but Kessel (1972) reports that even through the 1940s and 1950s a scant five references to imagery are to be found in Psychological Abstracts. Admittedly some interest in the psychology of imagery continued outside the United States in this era. In Britain, for example, psychologists such as Pear (1925, 1927), Bartlett (1927, 1932), and, latterly, McKellar (1957) kept an interest in the topic alive. However, this work did not have much contemporaneous impact in the United States, which by the 1930s had already achieved its dominant superpower status in psychology, if not yet in other domains. A general revival of interest in imagery did not get under way in America before the1960s. By that time the Behaviorist consensus was beginning to break down (as can be seen in the work of Mowrer (1960), who tried to patch-up Behaviorist learning theory by introducing the alien concept of imagery into it), and new and striking empirical findings about imagery emerged to play a significant role in the cognitive revolution.
| • | Ahsen A. (1984). ISM: The Triple Code Model for Imagery and Psychophysiology. Journal of Mental Imagery (8) 15-42. |
| • | Anderson, J.R. (1978). Arguments
Concerning Representations for Mental Imagery. Psychological
Review (85) 249-77. [Argues that the "analog vs.propositional" (picture vs. description) question is ill posed.] |
| • | Anderson, J.R. (1979). Further Arguments Concerning Representations for Mental Imagery: A Response to Hayes-Roth and Pylyshyn. Psychological Review (86) 395-406. |
| • | Ash, M.G. (1998). Gestalt Psychology in German Culture, 1890-1967. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. |
| • | Audi, R. (1978). The Ontological Status of Mental Images. Inquiry (21) 348-361. |
| • | Aveling E. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the
Process of Thinking 2.
British Journal of Psychology (18) 15-22. [A companion piece to Pear (1927) and Bartlett (1927).] |
| • | Baars, B.J. (Ed.) (1996). Special issue on mental imagery of Consciousness and Cognition (5-iii). |
| • | Barsalou, L.W. (1999). Perceptual
Symbol Systems (with commentaries and author's
reply). Behavioral and Brain Sciences (22) 577-660.
[Preprint available online]
-->
[Purportedly not directly about imagery, but deals with the closely adjacent topic of mental representations that are inherently perceptual in character, and argues that they are adequate to account for cognition, and explanatorily superior to "amodal" conceptions of representation (such as mentalese).] |
| • | Bartlett, F.C. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the
Process of Thinking.
British Journal of Psychology (18) 23-29. [A companion piece to Pear (1927) and Aveling (1927).] |
| • | Bartlett, F.C. (1932). Remembering. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. |
| • | Bartley, W.W. (1973). Wittgenstein. New York: Lippincott. |
| • | Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A-C., De Gelder,
B. Denes, G., G., Dalla Barba, G., Brugieres, P. & Degos,
J.-P. (1998). Multiple-Domain Dissociation between Impaired Visual
Perception and Preserved Mental Imagery in a Patient with Bilateral
Extrastriate Lesions. Neuropsychologia (36) 239-249. [Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early visual areas of the brain. For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999).] |
| • | Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A-C., & Denes,
G. (1997). Preserved Imagery for Colours in a Patient with Cerebral
Achromatopsia. Cortex (33) 369-378. [See note on previous item.] |
| • | Bartolomeo, P., D'Erme, P., & Gainotti,
G. (1994). The Relation between Visuospatial Neglect and
Representational Neglect. Neurology (44) 1710-1714. [See Bisiach & Luzzatti (1978).] |
| • | Basso, A., Bisiach, E., & Luzzatti, C. (1980). Loss of Mental Imagery: A Case Study. Neuropsychologia (18) 435-442. |
| • | Baylor, G.W. (1972). A Treatise
on the Mind's Eye: An Empirical Investigation of Visual Mental
Imagery. Unpublished Ph.D. thesis, Carnegie-Mellon University,
Pittsburgh, PA. (University Microfilms 72-12, 699.) [The first serious attempt to simulate imagery computationally. The major inspiration for the description theory of Pylyshyn (1973).] |
| • | Baylor, G.W. (1973). Modelling the Mind's Eye. In
A. Elithorn & D. Jones (Eds.), Artificial and Human
Thinking. Amsterdam: Elsevier. [A brief sketch of the model detailed in Baylor (1972).] |
| • | Berkeley, G. (1734). A Treatise Concerning the
Principles of Human Knowledge. (2nd edn.) In M.R. Ayers
(Ed.). George Berkeley: Philosophical Works Including the Works
on Vision. London: Dent, 1975. [The ideas of Berkeley's philosophy are, to all intents and purposes, mental images.] |
| • | Bexton, W.H., Heron, W., & Scott,
T.H. (1954). Effects of Decreased Variation in the Sensory
Environment. Canadian Journal of Psychology (8)
70-76. [Sensory deprivation discovered to give rise to spontaneous and bizarre imagery.] |
| • | Bisiach, E. & Berti, A. (1990). Waking Images and Neural Activity. In R.G. Kunzendorf & A.A. Sheikh (Eds.) The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application. Amityville, NY: Baywood. |
| • | Bisiach, E. & Luzzatti,
C. (1978). Unilateral Neglect of Representational
Space. Cortex (14) 129-133. [Brain damaged patients who ignore things to their left also ignore the left side in their imagery. Also see the next item, and: Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, (1994), Coslett (1997).] |
| • | Bisiach, E., Luzzatti, C., & Perani, D. (1979). Unilateral Neglect, Representational Schema and Consciousness. Brain (102) 609-618. |
| • | Blachowicz, J. (1997). Analog Representation Beyond Mental Imagery. Journal of Philosophy (94) 55-84. |
| • | Block, N. (Ed.)
(1981a). Imagery. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [Widely read collection of pieces concerned with the analog/propositional debate..] |
| • | Block, N. (Ed.) (1981b). Readings in Philosophy of
Psychology, Vol. 2. London: Methuen. [Section on imagery adds to and complements the above.] |
| • | Block, N. (1983a). Mental Pictures and Cognitive Science. Philosophical Review (92) 499-539. |
| • | Block, N. (1983b). The Photographic Fallacy and the Debate about Mental Imagery. Noûs (17) 651-661. |
| • | Bloor, D. (1983). Wittgenstein: A Social Theory of Knowledge. London: Macmillan. |
| • | Blumenthal, A.C. (1975). A Reappraisal of Wilhelm Wundt. American Psychologist (30) 1081-1088. |
| • | Blumenthal, H.J. (1977-8). Neoplatonic Interpretations of Aristotle on Phantasia. Review of Metaphysics (31) 242-257. |
| • | Boring, E.G. (1950). A History of Experimental Psychology (2nd edn.). New York: Appleton. |
| • | Bower, K.J. (1984). Imagery: From Hume to Cognitive Science. Canadian Journal of Philosophy (14) 217-234. |
| • | Brandt, S.A. & Stark, L.W. (1997). Spontaneous Eye
Movements During Visual Imagery Reflect the Content of the Visual
Scene. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (9) 27-38. [Some direct experimental support of a Perceptual Activity theory of imagery. Cf. Hong et al. (1997).] |
| • | Brann, E.T.H. (1991). The World
of the Imagination: Sum and Substance. Savage, MD: Rowman
& Littlefield. [An ambitious philosophical history of conceptions of imagination and imagery, from ancient to contemporary times.] |
| • | Bringman, W.G. & Tweney, R.D. (Eds.) (1980). Wundt Studies. Toronto: Hogrefe. |
| • | Brodie, A. (1986-7). Medieval Notions and the Theory of Ideas. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (86) 153-167. |
| • | Brooks, L.R. (1967). The Suppression of Visualization by Reading. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (19) 287-299. |
| • | Brooks, L. R. (1968). Spatial and Verbal Components of the Act
of Recall. Canadian Journal of Psychology (22) 349-368. [Together with the above, this demonstrates selective interference between spatial perception and spatial (including visual) imagery. See Hampson & Duffy (1984) for a replication in congenitally blind subjects.] |
| • | Bugelski, B.R. (1970). Words and Things and
Images. American Psychologist (25) 1002-10012. [On imagery effects in verbal learning experiments.] |
| • | Bugelski, B.R. (1977). Mnemonics. In International Encyclopedia of Psychiatry, Psychology, Psychoanalysis, and Neurology, Vol. 7. New York: Van Nostrand Reinhold. |
| • | Bugelski, B.R. (1984). Imagery. In R.J. Corsini (Ed.). Encyclopedia of Psychology, Vol. 2. New York: Wiley. |
| • | Burnham, J.C. (1968). On the Origins of Behaviorism. Journal of the History of the Behavioral Sciences (4) 143-151. |
| • | Candlish, S. (1975). Mental Images and Pictorial
Properties. Mind (84) 260-262. [A critique of Hannay's (1971) defense of pictorialism.] |
| • | Candlish, S. (1976). The Incompatibility of Perception and Imagery:
A Contemporary Orthodoxy. American Philosophical
Quarterly (13) 63-68. [Stewart Candlish informs me that the title of this article was misprinted in the published version. The title given above is the one he intended.] |
| • | Candlish, S. (2001). Mental Imagery. In S. Schroeder (Ed.).
Wittgenstein and Contemporary Philosophy of Mind.
London: Palgrave. [Discusses Wittgenstein's views on imagery, and their influence.] |
| • | Carpenter, P.A. & Eisenberg, P. (1978). Mental
Rotation and the Frame of Reference in Blind and Sighted
Individuals. Perception and Psychophysics (23)
117-124. [Mental rotation effect demonstrated in congenitally blind subjects.] |
| • | Casey, E.S. (1971). Imagination: Imagining and the Image. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (31) 475-90. |
| • | Casey, E.S. (1976). Imagining: A Phenomenological Study. Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press. |
| • | Casey, E.S. (1977-8). Imagining and Remembering. Review of Metaphysics (31) 187-209. |
| • | Chambers, D. (1993). Images are Both Depictive and
Descriptive. In B. Roskos-Ewoldsen, M.J. Intons-Peterson &
R.E. Anderson (Eds.). Imagery, Creativity and Discovery: A
Cognitive Perspective. Amsterdam: Elsevier. (pp. 77-97) [If neither theory fits the facts, why not choose both.] |
| • | Chambers, D. & Reisberg,
D. (1985). Can Mental Images be Ambiguous? Journal of
Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (11)
317-328. [A very striking experiment; but see Peterson et al. (1992), Rollins (1994), Cornoldi et al, (1996), Slezak (1991, 1995), and other listed works by Chambers and/or Reisberg for related (and often conflicting) experimental results, and competing interpretations.] |
| • | Chambers, D. & Reisberg, D. (1992). What an Image Depicts Depends on What an Image Means: An Image of a Duck Does Not Include a Rabbit's Nose. Cognitive Psychology (24) 145-174. |
| • | Cohen, D. (1979). J. B. Watson -- the Founder of Behaviorism: A Biography. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. |
| • | Cohen, J. (1996). The Imagery Debate: A Critical Assessment. Journal of Philosophical Research (21) 149-182. |
| • | Cornoldi, C., Logie, R.H., Brandimonte, M.A., Kaufmann,
G., & Reisberg, D. (1996). Stretching the Imagination:
Representation and Transformation in Mental Imagery. Oxford:
Oxford University Press. [See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Coslett, H.B. (1997). Neglect in Vision and Visual
Imagery: A Double Dissociation. Brain (120)
1163-1171. [See note at Bisiach & Luzzatti (1978).] |
| • | Crammond, D.J. (1997). Motor Imagery: Never in Your Wildest Dreams. Trends in Neuroscience (20-2) 54-57. |
| • | Currie, G. (1995). Visual Imagery as the Simulation of Vision. Mind and Language (10) 25-44. |
| • | Currie, G. & Ravenscroft, I. (1997). Mental Simulation and Motor Imagery. Philosophy of Science (64) 161-180. |
| • | Danto, A.C. (1958). Concerning Mental Pictures. Journal of Philosophy (55) 12-20. |
| • | Danziger, K. (1979). The Positivist Repudiation of Wundt. Journal of the History of the Behavioral Sciences (15) 205-230. |
| • | Danziger, K. (1980). The History of Introspection Reconsidered. Journal of the History of the Behavioral Sciences (16) 241-262. |
| • | Daston, L. (1998). Fear and loathing of the imagination in science. Dædalus (127-1) 73-95. |
| • | Denis, M., Engelkamp, J., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) (1988). Cognitive and Neuropsychological Approaches to Mental Imagery. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff. |
| • | Denis, M. & Carfantan, M. (1985). People's
Knowledge About Images. Cognition (20) 49-60. [An empirical study of the folk psychology of imagery.] |
| • | Dennett, D.C. (1969). Content and
Consciousness. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. [Argues that the inherent vagueness of images suggests that they are more like descriptions than pictures. (See, e.g. Hannay, 1971, Block, 1983b, and Tye, 1991, for counter arguments.)] |
| • | Dennett, D.C. (1978). Two Approaches to Mental Imagery. In his Brainstorms. Montgomery, VT: Bradford Books. |
| • | Dennett, D.C. (1991). Consciousness
Explained. Boston, MA: Little, Brown. [Chapter 10 attempts to integrate Kosslyn's quasi-pictorial theory of imagery into Dennett's philosophical framework.] |
| • | Deutsch, M. (1981). Imagery and Inference in Physical Research. In Tweney, R. D., Doherty, M. E., & Mynatt, C. R. (Eds.), On Scientific Thinking (pp. 354-360). New York: Columbia University Press. (Extract from original work of 1959.) |
| • | Dror, I.E., Ivey, C., & Rogus, C. (1997). Visual Mental Rotation of Possible and Impossible Objects. Psychonomic Bulletin and Review (4) 242-247. |
| • | Dunlap, K. (1912). The Case Against Introspection. Psychological Review (19) 404-413. |
| • | Dunlap, K. (1914). Images and Ideas. Johns Hopkins
University Circular (3 -- March 1914) 25-41. [A motor theory of imagery. See Washburn (1916) for a related view, and Thomas (1989) for discussion.] |
| • | Dunlap, K. (1932). Knight Dunlap. In C. Murchison (Ed.), A History of Psychology in Autobiography (Vol. 2, pp. 35-61). Worcester, MA: Clark University Press. |
| • | Ellis, R.D. (1995). Questioning Consciousness: The
Interplay of Imagery, Cognition, and Emotion in the Human
Brain. Amsterdam: John Benjamins. [Gives an imagery based theory of thought and semantics. See Thomas (1997b) for discussion.] |
| • | Esrock, E.J. (1994). The Reader's Eye: Visual
Imaging as Reader Response. Baltimore, MD. Johns Hopkins
University Press. [A historical treatment of the role of the concept of mental (as opposed to verbal) imagery in 20th century literary criticism, and a proposal, drawing on cognitive psychology research, for a mental imagery based theory of response to literature. Cf. Scarry (1999).] |
| • | Fancher, R.E. (1996). Pioneers of Psychology (3rd edn.). New York: W.W. Norton. |
| • | Farah, M.J. (1984). The Neurological Basis of Mental Imagery: A Componential Analysis. Cognition (18) 245-72. |
| • | Farah, M.J. (1988). Is Visual Imagery Really Visual? Overlooked Evidence from Neuropsychology. Psychological Review (95) 307-317. |
| • | Farah, M. J., Hammond, K. M., Levine, D. N., & Calvanio, R. (1988). Visual and Spatial Mental Imagery: Dissociable Systems of Representation. Cognitive Psychology (20) 439-462. |
| • | Farah, M. J., Soso, M. J., & Dasheif, R. M. (1992). Visual Angle of the Mind's Eye Before and After Unilateral Occipital Lobectomy. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (18) 241-246. |
| • | Farley, A.M. (1974). VIPS: A Visual Imagery
Perception System; the Result of Protocol
Analysis. Unpublished Ph.D. thesis, Carnegie-Mellon
University, Pittsburgh, PA. [Computer model of imagery based on the perceptual activity theory of Hochberg (1968).] |
| • | Farley, A.M. (1976). A Computer Implementation of
Constructive Visual Imagery and Perception. In R.A. Monty
J.W. Senders (Eds.) Eye Movements and
Psychological Processes. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. [A concise account of the model developed by Farley (1974).] |
| • | Ferguson, E.S. (1977). The Mind's Eye: Nonverbal Thought in Technology. Science (197) 827-836. |
| • | Ferguson, E.S. (1992). Engineering and the Mind's Eye. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. |
| • | Finke, R.A. (1980). Levels of Equivalence in Imagery and Perception. Psychological Review (87) 113-132. |
| • | Finke, R.A. (1985). Theories Relating Imagery to Perception. Psychological Bulletin (98) 236-259. |
| • | Finke, R.A. (1986). Mental Imagery and the Visual System. Scientific American (245 #iii, March) 76-83. |
| • | Finke, R.A. (1989). Principles of Mental
Imagery. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [Useful textbook of the experimental cognitive psychology of imagery.] |
| • | Finke, R.A., Pinker, S., & Farah, M.J. (1989). Reinterpreting Visual Patterns in Mental Imagery. Cognitive Science (13) 51-78. |
| • | Finke, R.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1986). Visual Functions of Mental Imagery. In K.R. Boff, L. Kaufman, & J.P. Thomas (Eds.). Handbook of Perception and Human Performance, Vol. 2. New York: Wiley-Interscience. |
| • | Finke, R.A., Ward, T.B., & Smith,
S.M. (1992). Creative Cognition: Theory, Research, and
Applications. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [Gives imagery a large role in inventive thinking.] |
| • | Flew, A. (1953). Images, Supposing and Imagining. Philosophy (28) 246-254. |
| • | Fodor, J.A. (1975). The Language of
Thought. New York: Thomas Crowell. (Paperback edition: Harvard
University Press, 1980) [Argues that imagery representations must be semantically dependent on representations that are linguistic in form.] |
| • | Freyd, J.J. (1987). Dynamic Mental Representations. Psychological Review (94) 427-38. |
| • | Furlong, E.J. (1953). Abstract Ideas and Images. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (Supplementary volume 27) 121-136. |
| • | Furlong, E.J. (1961). Imagination. London: Allen & Unwin. |
| • | Galton, F. (1880). Statistics of Mental
Imagery. Mind (5) 301-318. [Pioneering individual differences survey.] |
| • | Galton, F. (1883). Inquiries into
Human Faculty and its Development. London: Macmillan. [Summarizes and discusses results of the above.] |
| • | Gardner, H. (1987). The Mind's New Science: A
History of the Cognitive Revolution (2nd edition). New York:
Basic Books. [Includes a fairly good account of the "analog-propositional" debate.] |
| • | Georgopoulos, A.P., Lurito, J.T., Petrides, M., &
Schwartz, A.B. (1989). Mental Rotation of the Neuronal Population
Vector. Science (243) 234-236. [A neuroscientific study of the mental rotation effect (in monkeys) which links it to motor control.] |
| • | Giaquinto, M. (1992). Visualizing as a Means of Geometrical Discovery. Mind and Language (7) 382-401. |
| • | Giaquinto, M. (1993). Visualizing in Arithmetic. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (53) 385-396. |
| • | Gibson, J.J. (1970). On the Relation Between Hallucination and Perception. Leonardo (3) 425-7. |
| • | Gibson, J.J. (1974). Visualizing Conceived as Visual Apprehending Without Any Particular Point of Observation. Leonardo (7) 41-42. |
| • | Glasgow, J.I. (1993). The Imagery Debate Revisited: A
Computational Perspective. Computational Intelligence
(9) 310-333. [Printed with numerous peer commentaries and author's reply.] |
| • | Glasgow, J. & Papadias, D. (1992). Computational Imagery. Cognitive Science (16) 355-394. |
| • | Goldenberg, G. (1989). The Ability of Patients with Brain Damage to Generate Mental Visual Images. Brain (112) 305-325. |
| • | Gray, C.R. & Gummerman, K. (1975). The Enigmatic Eidetic Image: A Critical Examination of Methods, Data, and Theories. Psychological Bulletin (82) 383-407. |
| • | Haber, R.N. (1979). Twenty Years of Haunting Eidetic
Imagery: Where's the Ghost? Behavioral and Brain
Sciences (2) 583-629. [With appended commentaries.] |
| • | Hampson, P.J. (1979). The Role of Imagery in Cognition. Unpublished Ph.D. thesis, University of Lancaster, Lancaster, U.K. |
| • | Hampson, P.J. & Duffy, C. (1984). Verbal and Spatial
Interference Effects in Congenitally Blind and Sighted
Subjects. Canadian Journal of Psychology (38)
411-20. [Selective interference effects (see Brooks (1967, 1968)) demonstrated between spatial perception and spatial imagery in the congenitally blind.] |
| • | Hampson, P.J., Marks, D.F., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) (1990). Imagery: Current Developments. London: Routledge. |
| • | Hampson, P.J. & Morris, P.E. (1978). Unfulfilled
Expectations: A Critique of Neisser's Theory of
Imagery. Cognition (6) 79-85. [A critique of Neisser's (1976) perceptual activity theory of imagery. See Neisser (1978) for reply.] |
| • | Hampson, P.J. & Morris, P.E. (1979). Cyclical
Processing: A Framework for Imagery Research. Journal of Mental
Imagery (3) 11-22. [An attempt to synthesize the quasi-pictorial and perceptual activity theories.] |
| • | Hannay, A. (1971). Mental Images -- A
Defence. London: Allen & Unwin. [Argues for the reality of inner pictures.] |
| • | Hannay, A. (1973). To See a Mental Image. Mind (82) 161-262. |
| • | Harrison, B. (1962-3). Meaning and Mental Images. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (63) 237-250. |
| • | Harvey, E.R. (1975). The Inward Wits: Psychological Theory in the Middle Ages and the Renaissance. London: Warburg Institute, University of London. |
| • | Hayes, J.R. (1973). On the Function of Visual Imagery in Elementary Mathematics. In W.G. Chase (Ed.) Visual Information Processing. New York: Academic Press. |
| • | Hayes-Roth, F. (1979). Distinguishing Theories of Mental Representation: A Critique of Anderson's ‘Arguments Concerning Mental Imagery’. Psychological Review (86) 376-382. |
| • | Hebb, D.O. (1968). Concerning
Imagery. Psychological Review (75) 466-477. [Outlines a version of motor or perceptual activity theory.] |
| • | Hebb, D.O. (1969). The Mind's Eye. Psychology Today (2) 54-57 & 67-68. |
| • | Hegarty, M. (1992). Mental Animation: Inferring Motion
from Static Displays of Mechanical Systems. Journal of
Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (18)
1084-1102. [Animated mental images.] |
| • | Heil, J. (1982). What Does the Mind's Eye Look At?
Journal of Mind and Behavior (3) 143-149. [An adverbial account of imagery, which may be considered the philosophical counterpart (at the level of language analysis) to the perceptual activity theory in cognitive science. Imagery is regarded not as the having of a mental object (an image) in the mind, rather it is a type of activity, a way of thinking about some actual or possible real-world object. See Rabb (1975), Tye (1984) for other versions of adverbial theory.] |
| • | Heuer, F., Fischman, D., & Reisberg, D. (1986). Why
Does Vivid Imagery Hurt Colour Memory? Canadian Journal of
Psychology (40) 161-175. [Individual differences study using the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). A companion piece to Reisberg, Culver, Heuer, & Fischman (1986).] |
| • | Hilgard, E.R. (1981). Imagery and Imagination in American
Psychology, Journal of Mental Imagery (5) 5-66. [Historical reflections, with appended commentaries.]. |
| • | Hinton, G. (1979). Some Demonstrations of the Effects of
Structural Descriptions in Mental Imagery. Cognitive
Science (3) 231-250. [Argues for the view that images are "structural descriptions". A version of the "propositional" theory defended by Pylyshyn.] |
| • | Hochberg, J. (1968). In the Mind's Eye. In
R.N. Haber (Ed.). Contemporary Theory and Research in Visual
Perception. Holt Rinehart & Winston. New
York. pp. 309-331. [Argues for a perceptual activity approach.] |
| • | Holt, R.R. (1964). Imagery: The Return
of the Ostracised. American Psychologist (19)
254-266. [Influential account of the history of imagery in scientific psychology.] |
| • | Hong, C.C.-H., Potkin, S.G., Antrobus, J.S., Dow, B.M.,
Callaghan, G.M., & Gillin, J.C. (1997) REM Sleep Eye Movement
Counts Correlate with Visual Imagery in Dreaming: A Pilot
Study. Psychophysiology (34) 377-381. [Cf. Brandt & Stark (1997).] |
| • | Horne, P.V. (1993). The Nature of
Imagery. Consciousness and Cognition (2) 58-82. [With commentary.] |
| • | Humphrey, G. (1951). Thinking. London:
Methuen. [Contains what is probably still the best account in English of the views of the influential imageless thought school of German introspective psychology, including translations from primary sources.] |
| • | Intons-Peterson, M.J. (1983). Imagery Paradigms: How
Vulnerable are They to Experimenter's Expectations?
Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and
Performance (9) 394-412. [Shows that results of some imagery experiments may be seriously distorted by experimenters' expectations.] |
| • | Intons-Peterson, M.J. & Roskos-Ewoldsen, B.B. (1989). Sensory Perceptual Qualities of Images. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (15) 188-199. |
| • | Ishiguro, H. (1967). Imagination. Proceedings of
the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume (41)
37-56. [Images as intentional objects. (Strongly influenced by Wittgenstein and Ryle.)] |
| • | Jaensch, E.R. (1930). Eidetic Imagery and
Typological Methods of Investigation. (Translated from the
German by O.A. Oeser.) London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. [A seminal study of eidetic imagery, but seriously tainted by the racist assumptions of its Nazi milieu.] |
| • | James, W. (1890). The Principles of Psychology. New York: Holt. [Harvard University Press edition of 1983]. |
| • | Janssen, W. (1976). On the Nature of Mental Imagery. Soesterburg, Netherlands: Institute for Perception TNO. |
| • | Jay, M. (1993). Downcast Eyes: The Denigration of Vision in Twentieth-Century French Thought. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press. |
| • | Jonides, J., Kahn, R., & Rozin, P. (1975). Imagery Instructions Improve Memory in Blind Subjects. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (5) 424-6. |
| • | Kaufmann, G. (1980). Imagery, Language and Cognition. Oslo, Norway: Universitetsforlaget. |
| • | Keilkopf, C.F. (1968). The Pictures in the Head of a Man Born Blind. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (28) 501-513. |
| • | Kerr, N.H. (1983). The Role of Vision in ‘Visual
Imagery’ Experiments: Evidence from the Congenitally
Blind. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (112)
265-77. [Many "classic" experimental effects attributed to imagery can be reproduced in blind subjects.] |
| • | Kessel, F.S. (1972). Imagery: A Dimension of Mind Rediscovered. British Journal of Psychology (63) 149-62. |
| • | Kolers, P.A. (1987). Imaging. In R.L. Gregory & O.L. Zangwill (Eds.). The Oxford Companion to the Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press. |
| • | Kolers, P.A. & Smythe, W.E. (1979). Images, Symbols, and Skills. Canadian Journal of Psychology (33) 158-184. |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. (1980). Image and
Mind. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. [Seminal statement and defence of the computational Quasi-Pictorial theory of imagery, which has become the dominant view in cognitive science.] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. (1981). The Medium and the Message in Mental Imagery: A Theory. Psychological Review (88) 46-66. |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. (1987). Seeing and Imagining in the Cerebral Hemispheres: A Computational Approach. Psychological Review (94) 148-75. |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. (1983). Ghosts in
the Mind's Machine: Creating and Using Images in the
Brain. New York: Norton. [A popularization of the Quasi-Pictorial theory.] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. (1994). Image and
Brain: The Resolution of the Imagery Debate. Cambridge, MA:
MIT Press. [Updates the Quasi-Pictorial theory with an account of how imagery might be neurologically embodied.] |
| • | Kosslyn, S. M., Alpert, N. M., Thompson, W. L.,
Maljkovic, V., Weise, S. B., Chabris, C. F., Hamilton, S. E., Rauch,
S. L., & Buonanno, F. S. (1993). Visual mental imagery activates
topographically organized visual cortex: PET
investigations. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (5)
263-287. [Suggests that imagery depends on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain. For contrary evidence see: Roland & Gulyàs (1994), Mellet et al. (1996), Bartolomeo et al. (1997), Bartolomeo et al. (1998).] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. & Hatfield, G. (1984). Representation Without Symbol Systems. Social Research (51) 1019-1045. |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M., Pascual-Leone, A., Felician, O.,
Camposana, S., Keenan, J.P., Thompson, W.L., Ganis, G., Sukel,
K.E.. & Alpert, N.M. (1999). The Role of Area 17 in Visual
Imagery: Convergent Evidence from PET and rTMS. Science
(284) 167-170. [Suggests that imagery depends on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain. For contrary evidence see: Roland & Gulyàs (1994), Mellet et al. (1996), Bartolomeo et al. (1997), Bartolomeo et al. (1998).] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M., Pinker, S., Smith, G.E.,
& Shwartz, S.P. (1979). On the Demystification of Mental
Imagery. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2)
535-581. [With appended commentaries.] ] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. & Pomerantz,
J.R. (1977). Imagery, Propositions and the Form of Internal
Representations. Cognitive Psychology (9) 52-76. [A defence of Quasi-Pictorial theory against "propositional"/descriptional alternatives.] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M. & Shwartz,
S.P. (1977). A Simulation of Visual Imagery. Cognitive
Science (1) 265-295. [Computer model of Quasi-Pictorial theory.] |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M., Sukel, K.E., & Bly, B.M. (1999). Squinting with the Mind's Eye: Effects of Stimulus Resolution on Imaginal and Perceptual Comparisons. Memory and Cognition (19) 276-282. |
| • | Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., Kim, I.J., & Alpert,
N.M. (1995). Topographical Representation of Mental Images in
Primary Visual Cortex. Nature (378) 496-498. [Suggests that imagery depends on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain. For contrary evidence see: Roland & Gulyàs (1994), Mellet et al. (1996), Bartolomeo et al. (1997), Bartolomeo et al. (1998).] |
| • | Kreiman, G., Koch C., & Freid, G. (2000). Imagery Neurons in the Human Brain. Nature (408) 357-361. |
| • | Kunzendorf, R.G., Justice, M., & Capone, D. (1997). Conscious Images as "Centrally Excited Sensations": A Developmental Study of Imaginal Influences on the ERG. Journal of Mental Imagery (21) 155-166. |
| • | Kunzendorf, R.G. & Sheikh, A.A. (Eds.) (1990). The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application. Amityville, NY: Baywood. |
| • | Lawrie, R. (1970). The Existence of Mental Images. Philosophical Quarterly (20) 253-7. |
| • | Leahey, T.H. (1981). The Mistaken Mirror: On Wundt's and Titchener's Psychologies. Journal of the History of the Behavioral Sciences (17) 273-282. |
| • | Levine, D. N., Warach, J., & Farah, M. (1985). Two Visual Systems in Mental Imagery: Dissociation of "What" and "Where" in Imagery Disorder Due to Bilateral Posterior Cerebral Lesions. Neurology (35) 1010-1018. |
| • | Locke, J. (1700). An Essay Concerning Human
Understanding. [Edition of S. Pringle-Pattison (1924). Oxford:
Oxford University Press.] [It is not entirely clear whether Locke's term idea can always properly be equated with mental image. However, he certainly sometimes seems to have imagery in mind, and idea was generally treated as equivalent to mental image by many of his most important successors, including Berkeley and Hume.] |
| • | Logie, R.H. & Denis, M. (Eds.) (1991). Mental Images in Human Cognition. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science Publishers B.V. |
| • | Long, A.A. (1986). Hellenistic Philosophy: Stoics,
Epicureans, Sceptics. Berkeley, CA: University of California
Press. [Recounts the central role of imagery (phantasia) in Stoic and Epicurean epistemology.] |
| • | Loverock, D.S. & Modigliani, V. (1995). Visual Imagery and the Brain: A Review. Journal of Mental Imagery (19) 91-132. |
| • | Lowe, E.J. (1996). Subjects of
Experience. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. [Contains a sophisticated philosophical defense of the Lockean view that the meanings of linguistic utterances are rooted in imagery. Cf. Ellis (1995), Thomas (1997b).] |
| • | Luria, A.R. (1968). The Mind of a
Mnemonist. (Trans. L. Solotaroff.) New York: Basic
Books. [Seminal case study of a "hyper-imager".] |
| • | Marks, D.F. (1973). Visual Imagery Differences in the
Recall of Pictures. British Journal of Psychology (64)
17-24. [Introduces the VVIQ questionnaire, used for measuring individual differences in imagery vividness.] |
| • | Marks, D.F. (1983). Mental Imagery and Consciousness: A Theoretical Review. In A.A. Sheikh (Ed.) Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application. New York: Wiley. |
| • | Marks, D.F. (Ed.) (1986). Theories of Image Formation. New York: Brandon House. |
| • | Marks, D.F. (1999). Consciousness, Mental Imagery and
Action. British Journal of Psychology (90) 567-585. [Reviews work on individual differences in imagery vividness, and relates it to the psychology of action.] |
| • | Matthews, G.B. (1969). Mental Copies. Philosophical Review (78) 53-73. |
| • | McKellar, P. (1957). Imagination and Thinking. London: Cohen & West. |
| • | McMahon, C.E. (1973). Images as Motives and Motivators: A Historical Perspective. American Journal of Psychology (86) 465-90. |
| • | Mel, B.W. (1986). A Connectionist Learning Model for 3- Dimensional Mental Rotation, Zoom, and Pan. In Program of the Eighth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. |
| • | Mel, B.W. (1990). Connectionist Robot Motor
Planning. San Diego, CA: Academic Press. [A connectionist account of imagery, that links it to action plans.] |
| • | Mellet, E., Tzourio, N., Crivello, F., Joliot, M., Denis,
M., & Mazoyer, B. (1996). Functional anatomy of spatial mental
imagery generated from verbal instructions. Journal of
Neuroscience (16) 6504-6512. [Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain. For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999).] |
| • | Miller, A.I. (1984). Imagery in Scientific Thought:
Creating 20th Century Physics. Boston MA:
Birkhäuser. [Argues for an essential role for imagery in modern physical thought (and scientific thought in general).] |
| • | Mischel, T. (1970). Wundt and the Conceptual Foundations of Psychology. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (31) 1-26. |
| • | Modrak, D.K.W. (1987). Aristotle: The Power of Perception. Chicago: University of Chicago Press. |
| • | Moran, T.P. (1973). The Symbolic Imagery Hypothesis: A Production System Model. Unpublished Ph.D. thesis. Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA. (University Microfilms 74-14,657.). |
| • | Morris, P.E. & Hampson, P.J. (1983). Imagery and
Consciousness. Academic Press. London. [Usefully summarizes much experimental evidence. Covers quasi-pictorial, description, and perceptual activity theories, and attempts a theoretical synthesis.] |
| • | Mowrer, O.H. (1960). Learning Theory and the
Symbolic Processes. New York: Wiley. [An attempt to introduce imagery into Behaviorist theory.] |
| • | Mowrer, O.H. (1977). Mental Imagery: An Indispensible Psychological Concept. Journal of Mental Imagery (2) 303-321. |
| • | Nadaner, D. (1988). Visual Imagery, Imagination, and Education. In K. Egan & D. Nadaner (Eds.). Imagination and Education. Milton Keynes, U.K.: Open University Press. |
| • | Narayanan, N.H. (1993). Imagery: Computational and Cognitive Perspectives. Computational Intelligence (9) 303-308. |
| • | Neisser, U. (1967). Cognitive Psychology. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall. |
| • | Neisser, U. (1970). Visual Imagery as Process and as Experience. In J.S. Antrobus (Ed.). Cognition and Affect. Boston, MA: Little, Brown & Co. |
| • | Neisser, U. (1972a). Changing Conceptions of Imagery. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.). The Function and Nature of Imagery. London: Academic Press. |
| • | Neisser, U. (1972b). A Paradigm Shift in
Psychology. Science (176) 628-30. [A major player in the cognitive revolution places the revival of imagery research at its heart.] |
| • | Neisser, U. (1976). Cognition and
Reality. San Francisco, CA: W.H. Freeman. [Proposes a perceptual activity theory of imagery, an alternative to both pictorial and propositional/descriptional accounts.] |
| • | Neisser, U. (1978a). Anticipations, Images and
Introspection. Cognition (6) 167-174. [Defends the theory of Neisser (1976) from the critique of Hampson & Morris (1978).] |
| • | Neisser, U. (1978b). Perceiving, Anticipating and
Imagining. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of
Science (9) 89-106. [Summary version of the theory of Neisser (1976).] |
| • | Newton, N. (1982). Experience and Imagery. The
Southern Journal of Philosophy (21) 475-487. [Argues the importance of non-visual modes of imagery in human experience.] |
| • | Newton, N. (1989). Visualizing is Imagining Seeing: a reply to White. Analysis (49) 77-81. |
| • | Nicholas, J.M. (Ed.) (1977). Images, Perception and Knowledge, (Western Ontario Studies in the Philosophy of Science, #8). Dordrecht/Boston: Reidel. |
| • | Nussbaum, M.C. (1978). The Role of Phantasia in Aristotle's Explanation of Action. In her Aristotle's De Motu Animalium: Text with Translation, Commentary, and Interpretative Essays. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press. |
| • | O'Donnell, J.M. (1985). The Origins of Behaviorism: American Psychology, 1870-1920. New York: New York University Press. |
| • | Orne, M.T. (1962). On The Social Psychology of the Psychological Experiment: With Particular Reference to Demand Characteristics and their Implications. American Psychologist (17) 776-783. |
| • | Oster, G. (1970, February). Phosphenes. Scientific
American (222-ii) 82-87. [Phosphenes should not be confused with mental images.] |
| • | Paivio, A. (1971). Imagery and Verbal Processes. New
York: Holt, Rinehart and Winston. [Reprinted in 1979 -- Hillsdale, NJ:
Erlbaum] [Classic statement of the Dual Coding (imaginal and linguistic) theory of memory and mental representation, with much empirical evidence on the mnemonic effects of imagery. Paivio's work (together with Shepard's "mental rotation" experiments) probably played the key role in making imagery a scientifically respectable topic of investigation in cognitive science.] |
| • | Paivio, A. (1977). Images, Propositions and Knowledge. In J.M. Nicholas (ed.). Images, Perception and Knowledge. Dordrecht/Boston, MA: Reidel. |
| • | Paivio, A. (1986). Mental Representations: A Dual Coding
Approach. New York: Oxford University Press. [A major restatement and defense of "dual-coding" theory.] |
| • | Paivio, A. (1991). Dual Coding Theory: Retrospect and Current Status. Canadian Journal of Psychology (45) 255-287. |
| • | Paivio, A. (1995). Imagery and Memory. In M.S. Gazzaniga
(Ed.) The Cognitive Neurosciences. Cambridge, MA: MIT
Press. (pp. 977-986.) [For an even more recent statement and defense of Dual Coding Theory, see Sadoski & Paivio, 2001.] |
| • | Palmer, S.E. (1978). Fundamental Aspects of Cognitive
Representation. In E. Rosch & B.B. Lloyd (Eds.), Cognition
and Categorization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. [Argues that the "analog/propositional" debate over imagery misses the point about the nature of representation in computational theories of mind.] |
| • | Pear, T.H. (1924). Imagery and Mentality. British Journal of Psychology (14) 291-299. |
| • | Pear, T.H. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the
Process of Thinking 1. British Journal of Psychology (18) 1-14. [A companion piece to Bartlett (1927) and Aveling (1927).] |
| • | Perky, C.W. (1910) An Experimental Study of
Imagination. American Journal of Psychology (21)
422-52. [A famous study showing that mental images could be confused with (faint) percepts under certain conditions. See Segal (1971, 1972) for a modern attempt at replication.] |
| • | Peterson, M.A., Kihlstrom, J.F., Rose, P.M., &
Glisky, M.L. (1992). Mental Images Can be Ambiguous: Reconstruals
and Reference Frame Reversals. Memory and Cognition
(20), 107-123. [See the comment on Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Petre, M. & Blackwell, A.F. (1999). Mental Imagery in
Program Design and Visual Programming. International Journal of
Human-Computer Studies (51) 7-30. [A study of the (apparently quite significant) role played by imagery in the thought processes of computer programming.] |
| • | Piaget, J. & Inhelder, B. (1971). Mental Imagery in the Child. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. [Originally published in French as L'Image Mentale chez L'Enfant. Presses Universitaires de France, 1966.] |
| • | Pinker, S. (1980). Mental Imagery and the Third Dimension. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (109) 354-71. |
| • | Pinker, S. (1988). A Computational Theory of the Mental
Imagery Medium. In M. Denis, J. Engelkamp, & J.T.E. Richardson
(eds.). Cognitive and Neuropsychological Approaches to Mental
Imagery. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff. [A three-dimensional version of the "picture" (or array) theory.] |
| • | Popper, K.R. (1976). Unended Quest: An Intellectual Autobiography. London: Fontana/Collins. |
| • | Price, H.H. (1953). Thinking and
Experience. London: Hutchinson. [Contains a defense of an imagery based account of thinking and meaning.] |
| • | Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1973). What the
Mind's Eye Tells the Mind's Brain: A Critique of Mental
Imagery. Psychological Bulletin (80) 1-25. [A seminal attack on pictorial accounts of imagery. This was the opening salvo of the infamous analog/propositional dispute.] |
| • | Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1978). Imagery and Artificial
Intelligence. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of
Science (9) 19-55. [Pylyshyn argues that images are best conceived of as propositional descriptions within a general computational account of mental representation.] |
| • | Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1981). The Imagery
Debate: Analogue Media Versus Tacit Knowledge. Psychological
Review (88) 16-45. [A restatement of the propositional/descriptional account of imagery that squarely confronts the empirical arguments brought by pictorialists.] |
| • | Rabb, J.D. (1975). Imaging: An Adverbial
Analysis. Dialogue (14) 312-318. [An adverbial theory of imagery. Cf. Heil (1982), Tye (1984).] |
| • | Rees, D.A. (1971). Aristotle's Treatment of Phantasia. In J.P. Anton & G.L. Kustas (Eds.) Essays in Ancient Greek Philosophy. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press. |
| • | Reisberg, D. (Ed.) (1992). Auditory Imagery. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. |
| • | Reisberg, D. (1994). Equipotential Recipes for
Unambiguous Images: A Reply to Rollins. Philosophical
Psychology (7) 359-366. [See Rollins (1994) and the annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Reisberg, D. & Chambers, D. (1991). Neither Pictures
Nor Propositions: What Can We Learn From a Mental Image?
Canadian Journal of Psychology (45) 336-352. [See annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Reisberg, D., Culver, L.C., Heuer, F., & Fischman,
D. (1986). Visual Memory: When Imagery Vividness Makes a
Difference. Journal of Mental Imagery (10) 51-74. [Individual differences study using the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). Vivid imagers show worse color memory than less vivid imagers. A companion piece to Heuer, Fischman, & Reisberg (1986).] |
| • | Reisberg, D., Smith, J.D., Baxter, D.A., &
Sonenshine, M. (1989). "Enacted" Auditory Images are
Ambiguous; "Pure" Auditory Images are Not. Quarterly
Journal of Experimental Psychology (41A) 619-641. [An auditory analogue of the effect discovered by Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Reisberg, D., Wilson, M., & Smith, J.D. (1991). Auditory Imagery and Inner Speech. In R.H. Logie & M. Denis (Eds.). Mental Images in Human Cognition. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science Publishers B.V. (pp. 59-81). |
| • | Rey, G. (1981). Introduction: What are Mental Images? In N. Block (Ed.) Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Vol. 2. London: Methuen. |
| • | Rhem, L.P. (1973). Relationships Among Measures of Visual Imagery. Behavior Research and Therapy (11) 265-270. |
| • | Rhodes, G. & O'Leary, A. (1985) Imagery Effects on Early Visual Processing. Perception and Psychophysics (37) 382-388. |
| • | Ribot, T. (1890). Psychologie de
L'Attention. Paris: Alcan. [Translated as: The
Psychology of Attention. Chicago: Open Court, 1903] [Sketches a "motor" theory of imagery.] |
| • | Ribot, T. (1900). Essai sur L'Imagination
Créatrice. Paris: Alcan. [Translated as: Essay
on the Creative Imagination. Chicago: Open Court, 1906.] [Includes a "motor" theory of imagery, related to those of Dunlap (1914) and Washburn (1916).] |
| • | Richards, N. (1977). Depicting and Visualising. Mind (82) 218-229. |
| • | Richardson, A. (1969). Mental Imagery. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. |
| • | Richardson, J.T.E. (1980). Mental Imagery and Human
Memory. London: Macmillan. [Although the book is mainly concerned with empirical issues, chapter two is a Wittgenstein influenced philosophical discussion of the concept of imagery.] |
| • | Richardson, J.T.E. (1999). Mental
Imagery. Psychology Press: Hove, U.K. [Useful textbook surveying the cognitive psychology of imagery, including individual differences research.] |
| • | Robson, J. (1986). Coleridge's Images of Fantasy and
Imagination. In D.G. Russell, D.F. Marks, & J.T.E. Richardson
(Eds.) Imagery 2. Dunedin, New Zealand: Human
Performance Associates. [Imagery in Romantic psychological theory.] |
| • | Roe, A. (1951). A Study of Imagery in Research Scientists. Journal of Personality (19) 459-70. |
| • | Roland, P.E. & Gulyàs B. (1994). Visual
Imagery and Visual Representation. Trends in
Neuroscience (17) 281-286. [Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain. For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999).] |
| • | Rollins, M. (1989). Mental Imagery: On the Limits of Cognitive Science. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press. |
| • | Rollins, M. (1994). Re: Reinterpreting
Images. Philosophical Psychology (7) 345-358. [See Reisberg (1994) and the annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Roskos-Ewoldsen, B., Intons-Peterson, M.J., & Anderson, R.E. (Eds.) (1993). Imagery, Creativity and Discovery: a Cognitive Perspective. Amsterdam: Elsevier. |
| • | Roth, R.J. (1963). The Aristotelian Use of Phantasia and Phantasma. The New Scholasticism (37) 312-326. |
| • | Russell, D.G., Marks, D.F., & Richardson
,J.T.E. (Eds.) Imagery 2. Dunedin, New Zealand: Human
Performance Associates. [Proceedings of the Second International Imagery Conference (Swansea, Wales, 1985).] |
| • | Russow, L.-M. (1978). Some Recent Work on Imagination. American Philosophical Quarterly (15) 57-66. |
| • | Russow, L.-M. (1980). Towards a Theory of Imagination. Southern Journal of Philosophy (28) 353-369. |
| • | Ryle, G. (1949). The Concept of
Mind. London: Hutchinson. [Chapter 8 contains a seminal critique of pictorial accounts of imagery and questions the traditional concept of imagination as the image producing faculty. It is suggested that both imagination and imagery are conceptually related to pretending.] |
| • | Ryle, G. (1971). Phenomenology versus The Concept of
Mind. In his Collected Papers, Volume 1: Critical
Essays. London: Hutchinson. [Some qualifications of the view expressed in Ryle (1949).] |
| • | Sadoski, M. & Paivio, A. (2001). Imagery and Text: A Dual Coding Theory of Reading and Writing. Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum. |
| • | Samuels, M. & Samuels, N. (1975). Seeing with
the Mind's Eye: The History, Techniques and Uses of
Visualization. New York/Berkeley, CA: Random House/The
Bookworks. [Not a scholarly work.] |
| • | Sandbach, F.H. (1971). Phantasia Kataleptike. In
A.A. Long (ed.). Problems in Stoicism. London: Athlone
Press. [Imagery in Stoic epistemology.] |
| • | Sarbin, T.R. (1972). Imagination as Muted Role Taking. In
P.W. Sheehan (ed.). The Function and Nature of Imagery.
Academic Press. New York. pp. 333-354. [A version of perceptual activity imagery theory, strongly influenced by Ryle (1949).] |
| • | Sartre,
J.-P. (1936/1962). Imagination: A Psychological
Critique. Ann Arbor, MI: University of Michigan Press.
(Translated by F. Williams from the original French of 1936.) [Useful historical material, as well as the philosophical discussion.] |
| • | Sartre, J.-P. (1940/1948). The
Psychology of Imagination. New York: Philosophical
Library. (Translated by B. Frechtman from the original French of
1940.) [Argues the intentionality of imagery. Images are not inner objects.] |
| • | Scarry, E. (1999). Dreaming by the Book. Princeton NJ;
Princeton University Press. [A literary critic on the power of language to evoke mental imagery, and the importance of such imagery in the proper appreciation of literature. Cf. Esrock (1994).] |
| • | Scheerer, E. (1984). Motor Theories of Cognitive
Structure: A Historical Review. In W.Prinz & A.F. Sanders (Eds.),
Cognition and Motor Processes. Berlin/Heidelberg:
Springer-Verlag. (pp. 77-98). [Includes a brief description of Washburn's (1916) motor theory of imagery.] |
| • | Schofield, M. (1978). Aristotle on the Imagination. In G.E.R. Lloyd & G.E.L. Owen (Eds.) Aristotle on the Mind and the Senses. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. |
| • | Segal, S.J. (Ed.) (1971a). Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches. New York: Academic Press. |
| • | Segal, S.J. (1971b). Processing of the Stimulus in
Imagery and Perception. In S.J. Segal (1971a) pp. 73-100. [On attempting to replicate the Perky (1910) experiment.] |
| • | Segal, S.J. (1972). Assimilation of a Stimulus in the Construction of an Image: The Perky Effect Revisited. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery. (pp. 203-230). New York & London: Academic Press. |
| • | Segal, S.J. & Fusella, V. (1971). Effects of Images in Six Sense Modalities on Detection (d') of Visual Signal from Noise. Psychonomic Science (24) 55-56. |
| • | Segal, S.J. & Nathan, S. (1964). The Perky Effect: Incorporation of an External Stimulus into Imagery Experience under Placebo and Control Conditions. Perceptual and Motor Skills (18) 385-395. |
| • | Sergent, J. (1990). The Neuropsychology of Visual Image Generation: Data, Method, and Theory. Brain and Cognition (13) 98-129. |
| • | Sheehan, P.W. (Ed.) (1972). The Function and Nature of
Imagery. Academic Press. New York & London. [Valuable anthology of the "state of the art" at the time.] |
| • | Sheehan, P.W. (1978). Mental Imagery. In B.M. Foss (Ed.)
Psychology Survey. No.1. London: Allen & Unwin. [Helpful review article, but now dated.] |
| • | Sheikh, A.A. (Ed.) (1983). Imagery: Current Theory,
Research, and Application. New York: Wiley. [Useful, wide ranging collection.] |
| • | Shepard, R.N. (1975). Form, Formation, and Transformation
of Internal Representations. In R.L. Solso (Ed.) Information
Processing and Cognition: the Loyola Symposium. Hillsdale, NJ:
Erlbaum. [Defends "analog" account of imagery. Introduces concept of "second order isomorphism".] |
| • | Shepard, R.N. (1978a). Externalization of Mental Images and the Act of Creation. In B.S. Randhawa & B.F. Coffman (Eds.). Visual Learning, Thinking and Communication. London: Academic Press. |
| • | Shepard, R.N. (1978b). The Mental Image. American Psychologist (33) 125-137. |
| • | Shepard, R.N. (1981). Psychophysical Complementarity. In M. Kubovy & J.R. Pomerantz (Eds.) Perceptual Organization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. |
| • | Shepard, R.N. (1984). Ecological Restraints on Internal Representation. Psychological Review (91) 417-447. |
| • | Shepard, R.N., Cooper, L.A., et
al. (1982). Mental Images and Their
Transformations. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [A useful compendium of the seminal work by Shepard and his students on the "mental rotation" of images (and on related phenomena).] |
| • | Shepard, R.N. & Metzler,
J. (1971). Mental Rotation of Three-Dimensional
Objects. Science (171) 701-703. [A classic psychological experiment. The first, most striking, and best known of the mental rotation studies. Together with the work on the mnemonic effects of imagery (see Paivio, 1971) this played a major role in re-establishing the scientific respectability of imagery research.] |
| • | Shepard, R.N. & Podgorny, P. (1978). Cognitive Processes That Resemble Perceptual Processes. In W.K. Estes (Ed.) Handbook of Learning and Cognitive Processes. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. |
| • | Shorter, J.M. (1952). Imagination. Mind (61)
528-542. [Perhaps the earliest suggestion that imagining is more like describing than like seeing a picture (C.f. Dennett, 1969).] |
| • | Simon, H.A. (1972). What is Visual Imagery? An
Information Processing Interpretation. In L.W. Gregg
(Ed.). Cognition in Learning and Memory. New York:
Wiley. [Early sketch of a computational model of imagery.] |
| • | Slezak, P. (1991). Can Images be Rotated and Inspected? A
Test of the Pictorial Medium Theory. In Proceedings, Thirteenth
Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society
(pp. 55-60). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. [See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).] |
| • | Slezak, P. (1995). The "Philosophical" Case Against
Visual Imagery. In P. Slezak, T. Caelli, & R. Clark (Eds.)
Perspectives on Cognitive Science: Theories, Experiments and
Foundations. Norwood, NJ: Ablex. [A recent attempt to press the cognitivist case against pictorialism by a psychologically sophisticated philosopher.] |
| • | Sober, E. (1976). Mental Representations. Synthése (33) 101-148. |
| • | Squires, J.E.R. (1968). Visualising. Mind (77) 58-67. |
| • | Sterelny, K. (1986). The Imagery Debate. Philosophy
of Science (53) 560-583. [A philosopher's take on the "analog/propositional" debate.] |
| • | Taylor, J.G. (1973). A Behavioural Theory of
Images. South African Journal of Psychology (3)
1-10. [A rare attempt to assimilate imagery into Behaviorist theory.] |
| • | Taylor, P. (1981). Imagination and
Information. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research
(42) 205-223. [Despite arguments to the contrary from Sartre and Wittgenstein, we can gain new information from our mental imagery.] |
| • | Thomas, N.J.T. (1987). The Psychology of Perception, Imagination and Mental Representation, and Twentieth Century Philosophies of Science. Unpublished Ph.D. thesis, Leeds University, Leeds, U.K. (A.S.L.I.B. Index to Theses 37-iii No. 37-4561). |
| • | Thomas, N.J.T. (1989). Experience and Theory as
Determinants of Attitudes toward Mental Representation: The Case of
Knight Dunlap and the Vanishing Images of J.B. Watson. American
Journal of Psychology (102) 395-412.
[Available online] [Discusses the historical circumstances surrounding the "banishment" of imagery from psychological theory in the Behaviorist tradition, and considers certain conceptual confusions that may induce some people to discount the psychological significance of imagery. Dunlap's (1914) theory is outlined.] |
| • | Thomas, N.J.T. (1997a). Imagery and the Coherence of
Imagination: a Critique of White. Journal of Philosophical
Research, (22) 95-127.
[Available online] [Defends the traditional (Aristotelian) view of the concept of imagination as derivative from the concept of imagery, and argues that the root concept of both is perceiving as. Traces resistance to the Aristotelian view to unsupported pictorialist assumptions.] |
| • | Thomas, N.J.T. (1997b). A Stimulus to the
Imagination.
Psyche
(3) (On-line serial).
[Available online] [An essay review of Ellis (1995), which sets his work in a historical context and reviews some standard objections to the sort of imagery based semantics he proposes.] |
| • | Thomas, N.J.T. (1999a). Imagination. In
Dictionary of Philosophy of Mind (online dictionary), Chris Eliasmith (ed.).
[Available online] [Provides a brief sketch of the history of the concept, from Aristotle to the present.] |
| • | Thomas, N.J.T. (1999b). Are Theories of Imagery Theories
of Imagination? An Active Perception Approach to Conscious Mental
Content. Cognitive Science (23) 207-245.
[Available online] [Assesses cognitive theories of imagery both in empirical terms and in the light of their relationship to traditional views of imagination. Proposes and defends Perceptual Activity Theory as an alternative that is empirically and conceptually superior to both quasi-pictorial and propositional theories.] |
| • | Titchener, E.B. (1909). Lectures on the
Experimental Psychology of the Thought-Processes. New York:
Macmillan. [A radical defense of an image centered introspective psychology against the claims of the Wurzburg imageless thought school of introspectors.] |
| • | Trehub, A. (1977). Neuronal Models for Cognitive Processes: Networks for Learning, Perception and Imagination. Journal of Theoretical Biology (65) 141-169. |
| • | Trehub, A. (1991). The Cognitive
Brain. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [Ambitious neuroscientific theory, treating imagery as activity in the retinotopic maps of the visual system.] |
| • | Toulmin, S. (1969). Ludwig Wittgenstein. Encounter (32) 58-71. |
| • | Tweedale, M.M. (1990). Mental Representations in Later Medieval Scholasticism. In J.-C. Smith (Ed.). Historical Foundations of Cognitive Science. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer. |
| • | Tweney, R.D. (1987). Programmatic Research in Experimental Psychology: E.B. Titchener's Laboratory Investigations, 1891-1927. In M.G. Ash & W.R. Woodward (Eds.), Psychology in Twentieth Century Thought and Society (pp.34-57). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. |
| • | Tweney, R.D., Doherty, M.E., & Mynatt, C.R. (Eds.)
(1981). On Scientific Thinking. New York: Columbia
University Press. [Contains anecdotal but very suggestive extracts concerning the key role that imagery can play in the thought processes of scientists.] |
| • | Tye, M. (1984). The Debate About Mental
Imagery. Journal of Philosophy (81) 678-691. [An adverbial account of imagery that is abandoned in Tye's later writings on the subject. Cf. Rabb (1975) and Heil (1982) for other defenses of the adverbial theory.] |
| • | Tye, M. (1988). The Picture Theory of Mental
Images. Philosophical Review (97) 497-520. [A persuasive defense of "quasi-pictorial" theory against "descriptionist" criticisms.] |
| • | Tye, M. (1991). The Imagery
Debate. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. [This fills out the argument of Tye (1988) and gives an excellent philosophical account of the "analog/propositional" debate and the conceptual basis of (quasi-)pictorialism. However, it fails to look seriously beyond this context, and is rather unreliable on historical and empirical issues.] |
| • | von, Eckardt B. (1988). Mental Images and Their
Explanations. Philosophical Studies (53) 441-460. [A critique of Tye's (1984) adverbial theory.] |
| • | Warnock, M. (1976). Imagination. London:
Faber & Faber. [Imagery and imagination in Hume and Kant, in Romantic theory, and in Sartre and Wittgenstein.] |
| • | Washburn, M.F. (1916). Movement and Mental
Imagery. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin. [A motor theory of imagery. See Dunlap (1914) for another version.] |
| • | Washburn, M.F. (1932). Some Recollections. In C. Murchison (Ed.), A History of Psychology in Autobiography, Vol.2. Worcester, MA: Clark University Press. (pp. 333-358). [Available online] |
| • | Watson, G. (1982). Phantasia in Aristotle, De Anima 3.3. Classical Quarterly (32) 100-113. |
| • | Watson G. (1988). Phantasia in Classical Thought. Galway, Republic of Ireland: Galway University Press. |
| • | Watson, J.B. (1913a). Psychology as the Behaviorist Views
It. Psychological Review (20) 158-177.
[Available online] [The classic "Behaviorist manifesto". Questions the very existence of imagery.] |
| • | Watson, J.B. (1913b). Image and Affection in
Behavior. Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific
Methods (10) 421-8. [A more careful and detailed version of the anti-imagery position put forward in Watson (1913a).] |
| • | Watson, J.B. (1924). Psychology from the Standpoint of a Behaviorist (2nd ed.). Philadelphia, PA: Lippincott. |
| • | Watson, J.B. (1928). The Ways of
Behaviorism. New York: Harper. [Reports of memory images are "sheer bunk".] |
| • | Watson, J.B. (1930). Behaviorism (2nd ed.). Chicago: University of Chicago Press. |
| • | Watson, J.B. (1936). John Broadus Watson. In C. Murchison (Ed.), A History of Psychology in Autobiography (Vol. 3, pp. 271-281). Worcester, MA: Clark University Press. |
| • | Wekker, L.M. (1966). On the Basic Properties of the
Mental Image and a General Approach to their Analogue Simulation. In
Psychological Research in the U.S.S.R. Moscow: Progress
Publishers. [Imagery theory in the Soviet psychological tradition. Somewhat similar to the motor theories of Dunlap (1914) and Washburn (1916).] |
| • | Wexler, M., Kosslyn, S.M., & Berthoz, A. (1998). Motor Processes in Mental Rotation. Cognition (68) 77-94. |
| • | Wheeler, M.E., Petersen, S.E., & Buckner, R.L. (2000). Memory's Echo: Vivid Remembering Reactivates Sensory Specific Cortex. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the U.S.A. (97) 11125-11129. |
| • | White, A.R. (1990). The Language of
Imagination. Oxford: Blackwell. [Part one is an excellent, if selective, concise history of the concept of imagination. Part 2 argues (in the teeth of the strong historical consensus detailed in part 1) that there is no conceptual connection between imagination and imagery. See Thomas (1997a) for a critique of this view.] |
| • | Wright, E. (1983). Inspecting Images. Philosophy (58) 57-72. |
| • | Wundt, W. (1912). An Introduction to Psychology (2nd edn.). New York: Macmillan. [Translated from the German.] |
| • | Yates, F.A. (1966). The Art of Memory. London:
Routledge and Kegan Paul. [A celebrated and seminal history of mnemonic uses of imagery, from ancient to early modern times. Such techniques are shown to have had a previously unrecognized importance in the history of western thought.] |
| • | Yuille, J.C. (Ed.) (1983). Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. |
| • | Zemach, E.M. (1969). Seeing, "Seeing", and Feeling. Review of Metaphysics (23) 3-24. |
| • | Zimler, J. & Keenan, J.M. (1983). Imagery in the Congenitally Blind: How Visual are Visual Images? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (9) 269-282. |
First published: November 18, 1997
Content last modified: November 10, 2001