This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Notes to Structuralism in Physics


Notes

1. Einstein's resolution of this conundrum is celebrated. He took the practical indistinguishability to betoken a deeper identity and, in his Principle of Equivalence, asserted that the two cases are the same. In effect acceleration produces a gravitational field. The theoretical underdetermination is eliminated by declaring that the inertial force -mA is really a gravitational force after all. The two T-theoretical terms are really just the same; and an inertial system with a homogeneous gravitational field just is the same thing as a uniformly accelerated system without a gravitational field.



Copyright © 2002 by
Heinz-Jürgen Schmidt
hschmidt@physik.uni-osnabrueck.de

First published: November 24, 2002
Content last modified: November 24, 2002