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Extensionality:This axiom asserts that when sets x and y have the same members, they are the same set.
xy[z(zx zy) x=y]
The next axiom asserts the existence of the empty set:
Null Set:Since it is provable from this axiom and the previous axiom that there is a unique such set, we may introduce the notation Ø to denote it.
xy(y x)
The next axiom asserts that if given any set x and y, there exists a pair set of x and y, i.e., a set which has only x and y as members:
Pairs:Since it is provable that there is a unique pair set for each given x and y, we introduce the notation {x,y} to denote it.
xyzw(wz w=x w=y)
The next axiom asserts that for any given set x, there is a set y which has as members all of the members of all of the members of x:
Unions:Since it is provable that there is a unique union of any set x, we introduce the notation x to denote it.
xyz[zy w(wx & zw)]
The next axiom asserts that for any set x, there is a set y which contains as members all those sets whose members are also elements of x, i.e., y contains all of the subsets of x:
Power Set:Since every set provably has a unique `power set', we introduce the notation (x) to denote it. Note also that we may define the notion x is a subset of y (x y) as: z(zx zy). Then we may simplify the statement of the Power Set Axiom as follows:
xyz[zy w(wz wx)]
xyz[zy zx)
The next axiom asserts the existence of an infinite set, i.e., a set with an infinite number of members:
Infinity:We may think of this as follows. Let us define the union of x and y (xy) as the union of the pair set of x and y, i.e., as {x,y}. Then the Axiom of Infinity asserts that there is a set x which contains Ø as a member and which is such that, anytime y is a member of x, then y{y} is a member of x. Consequently, this axiom guarantees the existence of a set of the following form:
x[Øx & y(yx {y,{y}}x)]
{Ø, {Ø}, {Ø, {Ø}}, {Ø, {Ø}, {Ø, {Ø}}}, }Notice that the second element, {Ø}, is in this set because (1) the fact that Ø is in the set implies that Ø {Ø} is in the set and (2) Ø {Ø} just is {Ø}. Similarly, the third element, {Ø, {Ø}}, is in this set because (1) the fact that {Ø} is in the set implies that {Ø} {{Ø}} is in the set and (2) {Ø} {{Ø}} just is {Ø, {Ø}}. And so forth.
The next axiom asserts that every set is well-founded:
Regularity:A member y of a set x with this property is called a minimal element. This axiom rules out the existence of circular chains of sets (e.g., such as xy & yz & and zx) as well as infinitely descending chains of sets (such as x3 x2 x1 x0).
x[xØ y(yx & z(zx zy))]
The final axiom of ZF is the Replacement Schema. Suppose that (x,y,) is a formula with x and y free, and which may or may not have free variables z1, ,zk. Furthermore, let x,y, [s,r,] be the result of substituting s and r for x and y, respectively, in (x,y,). The every instance of the following schema is an axiom:
Replacement Schema:In other words, if we know that is a functional formula (which relates each set x to a unique set y), then if we are given a set u, we can form a new set v as follows: collect all of the sets to which the members of u are uniquely related by .
z1 zk[x!y(x,y,) uvr(rv s(su & x,y,[s,r,]))]
Note that the Replacement Schema can take you out of the set u when forming the set v. The elements of v need not be elements of u. By contrast, the well-known Separation Schema of Zermelo yields new sets consisting only of those elements of a given set u which satisfy a certain condition . That is, suppose that (x,) has x free and may or may not have z1, ,zk free. Then the Separation Schema asserts:
Separation Schema z1 zk[uvr(rv ru & x,[r,])]In other words, if given a formula and a set u, there exists a set v which has as members precisely the members of u which satisfy the formula .
First published: July 11, 2002
Content last modified: July 11, 2002