This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
Here we prove version of the Falsification Theorem that only assumes condition-independence. In the following, if result-independence holds as well, all occurrences of ‘(ck−1·ek−1)’ may be dropped, which gives the theorem stated in the main text. If neither independence condition holds, the following proof still works, but with all occurrences of ‘ck·(ck−1·ek−1)’ replaced by ‘cn·ek−1’ and with occurrences of ‘b·ck−1’ replaced by ‘b·cn’.
Theorem 1: The Falsification Theorem:
Suppose cm, a subsequence of the whole evidence sequence
cn, consists of experiments or observations with the
following property: whenever an outcome sequence ek−1 of
past conditions ck−1 is deemed possible by
both hj·b and hi·b,
there are outcomes oku of the next condition ck
deemed impossible by hj·b but deemed
possible by hi·b to at least some small degree
δ. That is, suppose there is a δ > 0 such that for each
ck−1 and each of its outcome sequences ek−1, if
P[ek−1 | hi·b·ck−1]
> 0 and
P[ek−1 | hj·b·ck−1]
> 0, then it is also the case that
P[{oku:P[oku | hj·b·ck·(ck−1·ek−1)] = 0} | hi·b·ck·(c k−1·ek−1)] ≥ δ. Then,
P[{en : P[en | hj·b·c n]/P[en | hi·b·c n] = 0} | hi·b·c n] = P[{en : P[en | hj·b·c n] = 0} | hi·b·c n] ≥ 1−(1−δ)m, which approaches 1 for large m.
First notice that for each ck from cm,
(1−γ) ≥ P[u{oku : P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0} | hi·b·ck·(c k−1·ek−1)] = ∑{oku∈Ok: P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0} P[oku | hi·b·ck·(ck−1·e k−1)].
And for each ck not from cm,
P[u{oku : P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0} | hi·b·ck·(c k−1·ek−1)] = 1.
Then,
P[{en : P[en | hj·b·c n] > 0} | hi·b·cn]
= ∑{en : P[en | hj·b·c n] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn] = ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0}
(∑{onu∈On: P[onu | hj·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)] > 0} P[onu | hi·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)]) · P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]= ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0}
P[u{onu : P[onu | hj·b·cn·(c n−1·en−1)] > 0} | hi·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)] · P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]≤ (1−γ) · ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0} P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1] if cn is from cm , or else = ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0} P[en−1 | hi·b·c n−1] if cn is not from cm; … ≤ Πk=1m (1−γ) = (1−γ)m.
So,
P[{en : P[en | hj·b·c n] = 0} | hi·b·cn] ≥ 1 − (1−γ)n.
Also,
P[{en : P[en | hj·b·cn]/P[e n | hi·b·cn] = 0} | hi·b·cn] = P[{en : P[en | hj·b·cn] = 0} | hi·b·cn],
because
P[{en : P[en | hj·b·cn]/P[e n | hi·b·cn] > 0} | hi·b·cn]
= ∑{en: P[en | hj·b·cn]/P[e n | hi·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn] = ∑{en: P[en | h j·b·cn] > 0 & P[en | hi·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn] = ∑{en: P[en | h j·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn] = P[{en : P[en | hj·b·c n] > 0} | hi·b·cn]. □
James Hawthorne hawthorne@ou.edu |