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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Infinitary Logic
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Definition of the Concept of Admissible Set

A nonempty transitive set A is said to be admissible when the following conditions are satisfied:
(i) if a, bA, then {a, b} ∈ A and missing text, please informAA;

(ii) if aA and XA is Δ0 on A, then XaA;

(iii) if aA, XA is Δ0 on A, and ∀xay(<x,y> ∈X), then, for some bA, ∀xayb(< x,y> ∈ X).

Condition (ii) -- the Δ0-separation scheme -- is a restricted version of Zermelo's axiom of separation. Condition (iii) -- a similarly weakened version of the axiom of replacement -- may be called the Δ0-replacement scheme.

It is quite easy to see that if A is a transitive set such that <A, ∈| A> is a model of ZFC, then A is admissible. More generally, the result continues to hold when the power set axiom is omitted from ZFC, so that both H(ω) and H1) are admissible. However, since the latter is uncountable, the Barwise compactness theorem fails to apply to it.

Copyright © 2004
John L. Bell
jbell@uwo.ca

Supplement to Infinitary Logic
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy