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This article focuses on aspects of Mohist thought as presented in the core doctrinal books (the ten triads, books 8-37) and the dialogues (books 46-49). (For more information on Later Mohist thought, see the separate entry for "Mohist Canons.")
The ten triads are ten sets of three essays expounding the ten main doctrines of the Mohist school. At the time the Mozi was compiled, each of the ten doctrines was represented by three identically titled essays, labeled the "upper," "middle," and "lower" parts of their respective triad. Six of the triads have been preserved complete; four are now missing one or two essays. The essays in the six complete triads are partly similar, running parallel in places for several paragraphs at a time. Yet the texts also show significant differences in language, structure, and content. A number of theories have been proposed to explain the significance of the three versions of each essay. The best explanation, supported by analyses of both language and content, seems to be that the essays belong to different chronological strata and thus represent different stages in the development of Mohist thought (Brooks, 1996; Fraser, 1998). Later, longer essays modify and supplement earlier, shorter ones, developing more sophisticated doctrines, remedying weak points, addressing new issues, and responding to objections. The different strata were probably produced by different writers or editors, who may have belonged to the same or different factions of the Mohist movement. However, the strata do not coincide exactly with the division of the texts into "upper," "middle," and "lower" versions, so these labels do not demarcate three distinct series of texts attributable to three different Mohist factions.
For a summary of the argument for this conclusion, including a brief critique of the most prominent competing theories, see the following supplement:
Significance and Chronology of the Triads
All but three of the essays in the ten triads begin with an incipit "Our Master Mozi states...," a formula used throughout the essays to introduce key doctrinal statements. Since much of the content of the texts is attributed to Mozi in this way, readers have traditionally been inclined to treat them as generally reliable reports of his speech and to regard Mozi as the author of all the ideas the texts present. However, this interpretive approach is undermined by several points.
First, what is known of ancient Chinese writing practices suggests that attribution of a doctrine to a historical figure in a Warring States text is not a sufficient reason for believing that the person actually espoused that doctrine. Most writing in pre-Han China was anonymous, and writers commonly placed their own ideas in the mouths of a venerated teacher or historical figure. For example, scholars have long argued plausibly that many remarks in the Analects attributed to Confucius and speeches in the Guanzi attributed to Guan Zhong were actually written long after their deaths. Moreover, existing texts were routinely rearranged, modified, and supplemented by editors and compilers.
Second, the essays in each triad sometimes present different, even incompatible views that suggest modifications in position over time in response to changing circumstances, challenges from opponents, and perceived weaknesses in earlier positions. One essay in each triad is considerably shorter than the others, which introduce and develop issues not raised in the briefer text. Often a single thinker will revise his views over time, of course, and it remains possible that all the essays express the thought of one man. But on the whole the disparities between them seem better explained by the hypothesis that they were composed by different writers and editors working in different social and intellectual settings. This hypothesis also best explains significant linguistic differences between some of the essays (for more information, see the discussion in Significance and Chronology of the Triads).
Third, in some essays, a significant portion of the argument is not attributed to Mozi at all, but presented in a narrator’s voice, with only occasional citations of Mozi’s words. This raises the possibility that the basic structure of the argument is due to the writer or editor, and not to Mozi himself.
Given these considerations, we cannot safely attribute to Mo Di himself all of the views expressed in the core doctrinal books, nor, a fortiori, those advanced in the rest of the anthology. A more defensible stance is that the doctrinal essays collect together texts by an unknown number of anonymous Mohist writers, which develop, refine, or extend basic themes or ideas first set forth by Mozi. But the available evidence is so limited that we have no rigorous way of determining which of the detailed statements in these texts, if any, represent Mozi’s own views and which are extensions, revisions, or entirely new ideas introduced by his followers. Moreover, even if we had some reliable means of picking out the founder’s original statements, the other, later material might well prove to be of greater interest.
For these reasons, in interpreting and discussing the Mozi, the most productive and defensible approach is probably to set aside the issue of which parts of the corpus do or do not represent the views of the historical Mo Di. At the same time, scholarly precision demands that we not suggest, even indirectly, that the texts are generally an accurate presentation of the words or views of a single great thinker named "Mozi," since historically we know this may well be false. Accordingly, instead of discussing the ideas of "Mozi," a historical figure whose exact relation to the texts is unknown, we should discuss the diverse, sometimes conflicting statements of "Mohist" doctrines, understood to be an evolving set of views preserved in a collection of texts probably composed by different persons over many years.
At first glance, the core doctrinal books of the Mozi may appear to be continuous, unified essays. Closer inspection, however, suggests that many of them are highly composite texts, produced by splicing independent short paragraphs together to form a longer whole. An editor or compiler’s hand is readily apparent in places, such as when semi-independent passages are integrated into a longer essay by repeating a brief concluding formula after each. Similar paragraphs are often reused in different books in the same or different triads (Maeder, 1992), and in a few places distinctive vocabulary strongly suggests that different paragraphs within the same book are of diverse origin (Fraser, 1998). It is thus probable that, like the anthology itself, some of the individual books were not originally written as integral works, but composed in piecemeal fashion or in stages, the writers or compilers gradually adding new sections over time.
A common conjecture about the three series of doctrinal essays is that they represent three separate redactions of a shared oral teaching (Graham, 1985). Stated in this simple form, this conjecture is probably incorrect, for three reasons. First, linguistic features indicate that the theory that the three series are the canonical texts of three groups of Mohists is probably mistaken (for details, see Significance and Chronology of the Triads). Second, the essays in each triad differ too extensively in structure and content to plausibly be considered alternative versions of the same orally transmitted teaching. In general, the three parts of each triad are not mere variants of each other, but address different issues and offer different arguments. Third, in some longer essays, paragraphs that run parallel to a shorter essay alternate with other paragraphs in which distinctive stylistic and linguistic features are clustered (Fraser, 1998). Also, topics raised briefly in one essay are sometimes developed at greater length in another, apparently later one. These patterns suggest that written versions of some of the essays were used as sources for others in the same triad, which supplement and expand on them.
These points make it unlikely that the three essays in each triad represent separate versions of a single, original oral teaching. The possibility remains, however, that the essays might be jointly based on a brief core of orally transmitted material, which was later written down and augmented by new, written material. Traces of this oral core might be evident in certain repetitive, formulaic passages in which two or more of the essays run almost exactly parallel. It is also likely that long after the Mohists adopted the practice of writing down their doctrines, some of their compositions continued to be intended for memorization and oral delivery, especially since some of the Mohists and perhaps much of their audience were probably illiterate. Hence even texts that were composed with the aid of writing may retain the rhythmic, repetitive, formulaic structure characteristic of oral composition and recitation.
Chris Fraser Chinese University of Hong Kong cjfraser@cuhk.edu.hk |