| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
1. Einstein's resolution of this conundrum is celebrated. He took the practical indistinguishability to betoken a deeper identity and, in his Principle of Equivalence, asserted that the two cases are the same. In effect acceleration produces a gravitational field. The theoretical underdetermination is eliminated by declaring that the inertial force -mA is really a gravitational force after all. The two T-theoretical terms are really just the same; and an inertial system with a homogeneous gravitational field just is the same thing as a uniformly accelerated system without a gravitational field.
| Heinz-Juergen Schmidt hschmidt@physik.uni-osnabrueck.de |