Chinese Term |
Approximate English Pronunciation |
Bian (disputation, dialectics) |
“be-yen!” pronounced as a single syllable |
Bian zhe (disputers, dialecticians) |
“be-yen!” as a single syllable, followed by
“juh” (rhymes with “uh-huh?”) |
Deng Xi (famous lawyer) |
“dung!” followed by “shee” as in
‘banshee’ |
Fei (not-this, wrong) |
“fey” |
Gongsun Long (proponent of white horse sophism) |
“gohng” (“go” plus an “-ng”
ending), followed by “soo-en” pronounced as one syllable,
with the vowel shorter than the English ‘soon’;
“lohng?” (“low” plus an “-ng”
ending) |
Hui Shi (proponent of paradoxes) |
“hway!”, “shr” or
“sher” |
Jian bai (hard and white) |
“jee-yen,” pronounced as a single syllable;
“bye?” |
Jixia (scholarly “thinktank” sponsored by
King Xuan of Qi) |
Two syllables: “jee!” followed by
“shee-ya!” |
Ke (admissible) |
“ker” without the final ‘r’ |
Mozi (classical text) |
“mwo!” followed by “dz” |
Qi (ancient state in northeast China) |
“chee?”, pronouncing the “ch” roughly as
in “watching” |
Qin (ancient state in western China; eventually
conquered all other states to form a unified empire in 221 B.C.) |
“chin?”, pronouncing the “ch” roughly as
in “watching” |
Shi (this, right) |
“shr!” or “sher!” as in
“Sherlock” |
Shi (stuff) |
“shr?” or “sher?” as in
“Sherlock” |
Shuo (explanation) |
“shwo” |
Tong (same, similar) |
“tohng?” (“toe” plus an
“-ng?” ending) |
Wu hou (the dimensionless) |
“woo?” “hoe!” |
Xing (shape) |
“sheeng?” “shee” as in
‘banshee’ plus an “-ng?” ending |
Xunzi (Confucian thinker and eponymous text) |
“issue,” without the initial ‘i’ and
adding a final ‘n’, followed by “dz”
|
Yi (thought, intention) |
“e!” (a clipped pronunciation of the letter “e”) |
Zhao (ancient state in north China) |
“jow!”, rhyming with “ow!” |
Zheng ming (correcting or rectifying names) |
“jung!” as in ‘jungle’, followed by
“ming?” as in ‘mingle’ |
Zhi (pointing or referring) |
“jr” (similar to the first syllable of
‘gerbil’) |
Zhuangzi (classical Daoist text) |
“joo-wong” pronounced as one syllable, followed by
“dz” |