| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
1. We will use the terms ‘self-awareness’ and ‘self-consciousness’ interchangeably.
2. Drawing on Gibson's ecological approach, and the notion that the very flow pattern of optical information provides us with an awareness of our own movement and posture and that all perception consequently involves a kind of self-sensitivity, a co-awareness of self and of environment (Gibson 1966, 111-126), Bermúdez (1998, 128) writes: “If the pick-up of self-specifying information starts at the very beginning of life, then there ceases to be so much of a problem about how entry into the first-person perspective is achieved. In a very important sense, infants are born into the first-person perspective. It is not something that they have to acquire ab initio.” See Gallagher and Meltzoff (1996) for the connection between the developmental research and phenomenological conceptions of self-consciousness. For a more extensive discussion of the similarities between the non-conceptual self-awareness and the phenomenological view, see Zahavi (2002).
3. Husserl's analysis is not inconsistent with the concepts of ecological perception and sensory-motor "affordances" as they are later worked out in Gibsonian psychology. My actual and potential bodily movements specify the possible uses for things that I encounter in the world. This kind of analysis is further developed in Merleau-Ponty's phenomenology of perception and embodiment.
| Shaun Gallagher gallaghr@mail.ucf.edu | Dan Zahavi zahavi@cfs.ku.dk |