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Zermelo-Fraenkel Set Theory

Axioms of ZF

Extensionality:
∀x∀y[∀z(z∈x ≡ z∈y) → x=y]

The next axiom asserts the existence of the empty set:

Null Set:
∃x¬∃y(y ∈ x)

Since it is provable from this axiom and the previous axiom that there is a unique such set, we may introduce the notation ‘Ø’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that if given any set x and y, there exists a pair set of x and y, i.e., a set which has only x and y as members:

Pairs:
∀x∀y∃z∀w(w∈z ≡ w=x w=y)

Since it is provable that there is a unique pair set for each given x and y, we introduce the notation ‘{x,y}’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that for any given set x, there is a set y which has as members all of the members of all of the members of x:

Unions:
∀x∃y∀z[z∈y ≡ ∃w(w∈x & z∈w)]

Since it is provable that there is a unique ‘union’ of any set x, we introduce the notation ‘∪x’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that for any set x, there is a set y which contains as members all those sets whose members are also elements of x, i.e., y contains all of the subsets of x:

Power Set:
∀x∃y∀z[z∈y ≡ ∀w(w∈z → w∈x)]

Since every set provably has a unique ‘power set’, we introduce the notation ‘(x)’ to denote it. Note also that we may define the notion x is a subset of y (‘x ⊆ y’) as: ∀ z(z∈x → z∈y). Then we may simplify the statement of the Power Set Axiom as follows:

∀x∃y∀z[z∈y ≡ z⊆x)

The next axiom asserts the existence of an infinite set, i.e., a set with an infinite number of members:

Infinity:
∃x[Ø∈x  &  ∀y(y∈x → ∪{y,{y}}∈x)]

We may think of this as follows. Let us define the union of x and y (‘x∪y’) as the union of the pair set of x and y, i.e., as ∪{x,y}. Then the Axiom of Infinity asserts that there is a set x which contains Ø as a member and which is such that, anytime y is a member of x, then y∪{y} is a member of x. Consequently, this axiom guarantees the existence of a set of the following form:

{Ø,   {Ø},   {Ø, {Ø}},   {Ø, {Ø}, {Ø, {Ø}}},   … }

Notice that the second element, {Ø}, is in this set because (1) the fact that Ø is in the set implies that Ø ∪ {Ø} is in the set and (2) Ø ∪ {Ø} just is {Ø}. Similarly, the third element, {Ø, {Ø}}, is in this set because (1) the fact that {Ø} is in the set implies that {Ø} ∪ {{Ø}} is in the set and (2) {Ø} ∪ {{Ø}} just is {Ø, {Ø}}. And so forth.

The next axiom asserts that every set is ‘well-founded’:

Regularity:
∀x[x≠Ø → ∃y(y∈x & ∀z(z∈x → ¬(z∈y)))]

A member y of a set x with this property is called a ‘minimal’ element. This axiom rules out the existence of circular chains of sets (e.g., such as x∈y & y∈z & and z∈x) as well as infinitely descending chains of sets (such as … x₃ ∈ x₂ ∈ x₁ ∈ x₀).

The final axiom of ZF is the Replacement Schema. Suppose that φ(x,y,) is a formula with x and y free, and which may or may not have free variables z₁,…,z_k. Furthermore, let φ_x,y, [s,r,] be the result of substituting s and r for x and y, respectively, in φ(x,y,). Then every instance of the following schema is an axiom:

Replacement Schema:
∀z₁…∀z_k[∀x∃!yφ(x,y,) → ∀u∃v∀r(r∈v ≡ ∃s(s∈u & φ_x,y,[s,r,]))]

In other words, if we know that φ is a functional formula (which relates each set x to a unique set y), then if we are given a set u, we can form a new set v as follows: collect all of the sets to which the members of u are uniquely related by φ.

Note that the Replacement Schema can take you ‘out of’ the set u when forming the set v. The elements of v need not be elements of u. By contrast, the well-known Separation Schema of Zermelo yields new sets consisting only of those elements of a given set u which satisfy a certain condition ψ. That is, suppose that ψ(x,) has x free and may or may not have z₁,…,z_k free. Then the Separation Schema asserts:

Separation Schema ∀z₁…∀z_k[∀u∃v∀r(r∈v ≡ r∈u & ψ_x,[r,])]

In other words, if given a formula ψ and a set u, there exists a set v which has as members precisely the members of u which satisfy the formula ψ.

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