Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Actualism

New Actualism and Iterated Modalities

To see that iterated modalities pose no problem for new actualism, recall first that the sentences

(7) The pope (i.e., Karol Wojtyla) could have had a son who could have become a priest.
(8) There could be a planet disturbing the orbit of planet Y and it could have a period of Z years.

can be represented as follows:

(9) ◊∃x(Sxp &◊Px)
(10) ◊∃x(Dxy & ◊Pxz)

These have straightforward actualist truth conditions requiring no possibilia. For consider (9). The thing x which might have been both the pope's son and possibly a priest is a contingently nonconcrete object that at some other world is the pope's son and at yet another world is a priest.