Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Affirmative Action

1. While racial “set-asides” in public construction still remain somewhat contentious (they have been mostly foreclosed by Adarand v. Pena, 515 U. S. 200 [1995]), the public in general is not aroused by the vicissitudes of the federal contracting process and the good or ill fortune of construction firms. Although most contemporary writing focuses on affirmative action in college admissions, one recent book goes against the grain by examining affirmative action in faculty hiring. See Celia Wolf-Devine, Diversity and Community in the Academy: Affirmative Action in Faculty Appointments (Lanham, Maryland: Rowman & Littlefield, 1997.

2. Preferences for women don't figure into the current controversy because women have no trouble competing for college admissions. They now constitute 57 percent of all college students, half of all entering medical school students and half of all entering law school students. See

The story is quite different for blacks and Hispanics.

3. Hugh Davis Graham, The Civil Rights Era: Origins and Development of National Policy 1960-1972 (New York: Oxford University Press, 1990), p. 413.

4. So profound was the shock to the academy that Nicholas Capaldi, writing in 1985, remained under the impression that “[a]ffirmative action as a public policy was first applied on a massive and national scale to institutions of higher learning.” Nicholas Capaldi, Out of Order: Affirmative Action and the Crisis of Doctrinaire Liberalism (Buffalo, New York: Prometheus Books, 1985), p. 1.

5. John Rawls, A Theory of Justice (Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1971).

6. Thomas Nagel, “Equal Treatment and Compensatory Discrimination,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 2 (Summer 1973), 348-363.

7. Judith Jarvis Thomson, “Preferential Hiring,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 2 (Summer 1973), 364-484.

8. Ironically enough, the first discussions of “inverse” discrimination began in one of the prime sites of analytical philosophy, Analysis. For the full record of exchanges, see James W. Nickel, “Discrimination and Morally Relevant Characteristics,” Analysis, 32 (March 1972), 113-14; J. L. Cowan, “Inverse Discrimination,” Analysis, 33 (October 1972), 10-12; Paul Taylor, “Reverse Discrimination and Compensatory Justice,” Analysis, 33 (June 1973), 177-82; Roger Shiner, “Individuals, Groups and Inverse Discrimination,” Analysis, 33 (June 1973), 185-87; Philip Silvestri, “The Justification of Inverse Discrimination,” Analysis, 34 (October 1973), 31; William A. Nunn, “Reverse Discrimination,” Analysis, 34 (April 1974), 151-54; James W. Nickel, “Should Reparations Be to Individuals or Groups?” Analysis, 34 (April 1974), 154-60; Alan Goldman, “Reparations to Individuals or Groups?” Analysis, 35 (April 1975), 168-70; Sara Ann Ketchum and Christine Pierce, “Implicit Racism,” Analysis, 36 (January, 1976), 91-5; Paul Woodruff, “What's Wrong with Discrimination?” Analysis, 36 (March 1976), 158-60; Robert L. Simon, “Statistical Justification of Discrimination,” Analysis, 38 (January 1978), 37-42.

9. See, for example, Gertrude Ezorsky, “Hiring Women Faculty,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 7 (Autumn 1977), 86.

10. Alan Goldman, “Affirmative Action,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 5 (Winter 1976), 182-83.

11. Robert Simon, “Preferential Hiring: A Reply to Judith Jarvis Thomson,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 3 (Spring 1974), 315-19; George Sher, Justifying Reverse Discrimination in Employment,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 4 (Winter 1975), 162; George Sher, “Reverse Discrimination, the Future, and the Past,” Ethics, 90 (October 1979), 81-2; Alan Goldman, “Affirmative Action,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 5 (Winter 1976), 190-1. See also Robert K. Fullinwider, “Preferential Hiring and Compensation,” Social Theory and Practice (Spring 1975), 307-320; Alan Goldman, Justice and Reverse Discrimination (Princeton, New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 1979), 65-102; Robert K. Fullinwider, The Reverse Discrimination Controversy: A Moral and Legal Analysis (Totowa, New Jersey: Rowman & Littlefield, 1980), pp. 30-44.

12. Thomson, “Preferential Hiring,” p. 377; Simon, “Preferential Hiring: A Reply,” 312.

13. Goldman, “Affirmative Action,” p. 191; Goldman, Justice and Reverse Discrimination, pp. 24-8.

14. Barry R. Gross, “Is Turn About Fair Play?” in Barry R. Gross, ed., Reverse Discrimination (Buffalo, New York: Prometheus Books, 1977), p. 382; Barry R. Gross, Discrimination in Reverse: Is Turnabout Fair Play (New York: New York University Press, 1978), p. 97.

15. Robert L. Simon, “Individual Rights and ‘Benign’ Discrimination,” Ethics, 90 (October 1979), 96.

16. Terry Eastland and William Bennett, Counting By Race: Equality from the Founding Fathers to Bakke and Weber (New York: Basic Books, 1979), 144.

17. Gross, Discrimination in Reverse, 125-42.

18. Mary Anne Warren, “Secondary Sexism and Quota Hiring,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 6 (Spring 1977), 256.

19. James Rachels, “What People Deserve,” in John Arthur and William Shaw, eds., Justice and Economic Distribution (Englewood Cliffs, New Jersey, Prentice-Hall, 1978), 162.

20. See Sher, “Justifying Reverse Discrimination,” 165ff.

21. Lisa Newton, “Reverse Discrimination as Unjustified,” Ethics, 83 (July 1973), 310. Similar sentiments were expressed by Virginia Black:

If it is irrational and unjust and cruel to fire someone because he is a black or she is a woman — cases whose absurdity seems obvious — then it is equally irrational and unjust and cruel to hire someone because be is a black or she is a woman. To appreciate the parallel, one has only to remember that to hire X because of color is, ipso facto, not to hire Y because of color. When inscribed in law, this is racism.

Virginia Black, “The Erosion of Legal Principles in the Creation of Legal Policies,” Ethics, 84 (January 1974), 106. See more recently Nicholas Capaldi, “The Liberal Paradigm in Affirmative Action Law,” Loyola Law Review, 43 (Winter 1998), pp. 535, 536 (affirmative action “incoherent” in practice and “illogical”).

22. Eastland and Bennett, Counting By Race, 149. This idea that using racial preferences involved a kind of practical contradiction was given voice and support at the highest levels of government in the 1980s. William Bradford Reynolds, during his tenure as Assistant Attorney General for Civil Rights in the Reagan Administration, contended:

[T]o those who argue that we must use race to get beyond racism …[h]istory teaches us all too well that such an approach does not work. It is wrong when the government bestows advantages on whites at the expense of innocent blacks; it assumes no greater claim of morality if the tables are turned…. Whatever group membership one inherits, it carries with it no entitlement to preferential treatment over those not similarly endowed with the same immutable characteristics. Any compromise of this principle is discrimination, plain and simple, and such behavior is no more tolerable when employed remedially, in the name of “affirmative action” or “racial balance,” to bestow a gratuitous advantage on members of a particular group, than when it is divorced from such beneficence and for the most invidious of reasons works to one's disadvantage.

William Bradford Reynolds, “Individualism vs. Group Rights: The Legacy of Brown,” Yale Law Journal, 93 (May 1984), 1004. While Reynolds found the proposition, “Use race to achieve a colorblind society,” an assault on common sense, he belonged to an administration — like a long line of previous administrations — whose defense policy was grounded on the proposition, “Prepare for war in order to have peace.”

23. Richard Wasserstrom, “Racism, Sexism, and Preferential Treatment: An Approach to the Topics,” UCLA Law Review, 24 (February 197), 581-622.

24. Carl Cohen, Naked Racial Preference (Lanham, Maryland: Madison Books, 1995), 20.

25. Cohen, Naked Racial Preference, 52.

26. Goldman, Justice and Reverse Discrimination, 164-65.

27. Title 42 United States Code Sec. 2000d. Title IX of the Education Amendments of 1972 promised the same protection against gender discrimination. See 20 USC 1681.

28. “(a) It shall be unlawful for an employer (1) to refuse to hire or to discharge any individual, or otherwise to discriminate against any individual with respect to his compensation, terms, conditions, or privileges of employment, because of such individual's race, color, religion, sex, or national origin; or (2) to limit, segregate, or classify his employees or applicants in any way which would tend to deprive any individual of employment opportunities or otherwise adversely affect his status as an employee, because of such individual's race, color, religion, sex, or national origin.” Title 42 USC Sec 2000e-2

29. Griggs v. Duke Power Company, 401 U.S. 424 (1971), at 430, 431. At issue in the case was the use of an aptitude test and a high-school graduation requirement to screen job applicants. Duke Power Company did not succeed in showing that the results of the aptitude test or the possession of a high school diploma bore any demonstrable relation to performance at such of its jobs as janitor, maintenance worker, and the like.

30. For a more extended discussion of goals and quotas, see Fullinwider, The Reverse Discrimination Controversy, 162-177.

31. Consider, for example, this 1969 court decision involving a union with a record of excluding blacks and Mexican-Americans. The court imposed an injunction that

prohibit[ed] discrimination in excluding persons from union membership or referring persons for work; prohibit[ed] use of member's endorsements, family relationship or elections as criteria for membership; …ordered the development of objective membership criteria and prohibited new members …until developed; and ordered continuation of chronological referrals for work, with alternating white and Negro referrals until objective membership criteria are developed.

On appeal, the Court of Appeals for the Fifth Circuit upheld the lower court. In its view,

[t]he District Court did no more than prevent future discrimination when it prohibited a continuing exclusion of Negroes through the application of an apparently neutral membership provision …which served no significant trade-related purpose. [Further] the District Court did no more [in barring new membership until objective criteria were developed] than ensure that the injunction against further racial discrimination would be fairly administered. Absent objective criteria …covert subversion of the purpose of the injunction could occur. The same administrative reasons support alternating white and Negro referrals…

Asbestos Workers v. Vogler, 407 F. 2d 1047 (1960), at 1051, 1055. Each part of the lower court's order, including the part that required racially balanced referrals, harkened back to a single ground: the part was necessary to prevent future discrimination.

32. For a list of Circuit Court decisions embracing this theory, see Robert K. Fullinwider, “Achieving Equal Opportunity,” in Robert K. Fullinwider and Claudia Mills, eds., The Moral Foundations of Civil Rights (Totowa, New Jersey: Rowman & Littlefield, 1986), 106-08 and accompanying footnotes.

33. Regents of the University of California v. Bakke, 438, U.S. 265 (1978). In 1974, the Court had accepted for decision a similar case involving a race-preference policy at the University of Washington Law School. However, perhaps experiencing second thoughts, the Court then dismissed the case as moot (the plaintiff, admitted to the Law School by a lower court, was about to graduate). See De Funis v. Odegaard, 416 U.S. 312 (1974).

34. Unlike Title VII, which is grounded in the Interstate Commerce Clause of the Constitution, Title VI is grounded in the federal government's spending powers. Brennan relied on Congressional debate to argue for the substantive identity of Title VI, on the one hand, and the Fourteenth Amendment to the Constitution (which forbids states to discriminate) and the Fifth Amendment (which incorporates the Fourteenth Amendment's strictures and applies them to the federal government), on the other hand. The debate can be summed up in this rhetorical question: “Why should the government through its spending be subsidizing acts of private discrimination that it would be forbidden by the Constitution to do itself?” See 438 U.S. 265, at 329-336 (Brennan, dissenting).

35. 438 U. S. 265, at 295-300 (Powell quoting from Archibald Cox, The Role of the Supreme Court in American Government [New York: Oxford University Press, 1976], 114).

36. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 300.

37. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 307.

38. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 308.

39. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U. S. 265, at 309.

40. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 311.

41. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 316.

42. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 358 (Brennan, dissenting).

43. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 376 (Brennan, dissenting).

44. For an early statement of the anti-caste principle, see Owen Fiss, “Groups and the Equal Protection Clause,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 5 (Winter 1976), 107-177.

45. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U.S. 265, at 363 (Brennan, dissenting).

46. A nice discussion of Bakke and equality's dictates can be found in “Bakke's Case: Are Quotas Really Unfair?” and “What Did Bakke Really Decide?” in Ronald Dworkin, A Matter of Principle (Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1985).

47. Georgia Warnke, “Affirmative Action, Neutrality, and Integration,” Journal of Social Philosophy, 29 (1998), 87-103.

48. Carl Cohen and James Sterba, Affirmative Action and Racial Preferences: A Debate (New York: Oxford University Press, 2003), p. 23.

49. Cohen and Sterba, Affirmative Action and Racial Preferences, p. 25.

50. Cohen and Sterba, Affirmative Action and Racial Preferences, p. 24.

51. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U. S. 265, at 318, 319.

52. Hopwood v. Texas, 78 F 3d 932 (Fifth Circuit, 1996).

53. Wessmann v. Gittens, 106 F 3d 798 (First Circuit, 1998).

54. Johnson v. Board of Regents, 263 F 3d 1234 (Eleventh Circuit, 2001).

55. Grutter v. Bollinger, 137 F. Supp. 2d 821 (2001).

56. For example, in 1992, when Cheryl Hopwood filed her law suit against the University of Texas Law School, it was using a two-track admissions policy in which applications from blacks and Hispanics were evaluated separately Ð and against more lenient standards Ð from other applications. See Hopwood v. Texas, 861 F. Supp. 551 (1994) at 561-2, 563, 575.

57. See Wygant v. Jackson, 476 U.S. 267 (1986); Richmond v. J. A. Croson Company, 488 U.S. 469 (1989); Adarand Constructors v. Pena, 515 U.S. 200 (1995).

58. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U.S. 306 (2003), at 330.

59. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 325.

60. Regents v. Bakke, 438 U. S. 265, at 318-19.

61. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 337.

62. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 339.

63. Gratz v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 244 (2003), at 287.

64. Gratz v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 244, at 288.

65. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 326.

66. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 367-69 (Rehnquist, dissenting) and 374 (Kennedy, dissenting).

67. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 375 (Scalia, dissenting) .

68. Gratz v. Bollinger, 122 F. Supp. 2d 811 (2000), at 823.

69. Gratz v. Bollinger, 135 F. Supp. 2d 790 (2001), at 796-797.

70. Grutter v. Bollinger, 539 U. S. 306, at 336.

71. William G. Bowen and Derek Bok, The Shape of the River: Long-Term Consequences of Considering Race in College and University Admissions (Princeton, New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 1998), 7.

72. Elizabeth S. Anderson, “Integration, Affirmative Action, and Strict Scrutiny,” New York University Law Review, 77 (November 2002), 1270-71.

73. Robert K. Fullinwider and Judith Lichtenberg, Leveling the Playing Field: Justice, Politics, and College Admissions (Lanham, Maryland: Rowman & Littlefield, 2004), 165-188.

74. Other good upshots for racial harmony or racial advancement can be imagined as well; see, for example, Sarah Stroud, “The Aim of Affirmative Action,” Social Theory and Practice, 25 (Fall 1999), 399ff.

75. Leslie A. Jacobs, Pursuing Equal Opportunities: The Theory and Practice of Egalitarian Justice (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004), 124-142.

76. Stephan Thernstrom and Abigail Thernstrom, America in Black and White: One Nation, Indivisible (New York” Simon and Schuster, 1997), 395-411.

77. Bowen and Bok, The Shape of the River, 63, 114, 144. For critiques of The Shape of the River, see Terrance Sandalow, “Identity and Equality: Minority Preferences Reconsidered,” Michigan Law Review, 97 (May 1999), 1874-1916, and Stephan Thernstrom and Abigail Thernstrom, “Reflections on The Shape of the River,” UCLA Law Review, 46 (June 1999), 1583-1631.

78. Richard Sander, “A Systemic Analysis of Affirmative Action in American Law Schools,” Stanford Law Review, 57 (November 2004), 478, 449, 460.

79. See Does Diversity Make a Difference”Three Research Studies on Diversity in College Classrooms (Washington, DC: American Council on Education & American Association of University Professors, 2000); and Mitchell J. Chang et al., eds., Compelling Interest: Examining the Evidence on Racial Dynamics in Higher Education (Stanford, Calif.: Stanford University Press, 2003).

80. Patricia Gurin, Eric L. Dey, Sylvia Hurtado, and Gerald Gurin, “Diversity and Higher Education: Theory and Impact on Educational Outcomes,” Harvard Educational Review, 72 (Fall 2002), 330.

81. Stanley Rothman, Seymour Martin Lipset, and Neil Nevitte, “Racial Diversity Reconsidered,” Public Interest, 151 (Spring 2003), 34.

82. See David Wilkins and G. Mitu Gulati, “Why Are There So Few Black Lawyers in Corporate Law Firms: An Institutional Analysis,” California Law Review, 84 (May 1996), 493-618; and Richard O. Lempert, David L. Chambers, and Terry K. Adams, “Law School Affirmative Action: An Empirical Study of Michigan Minority Graduates in Practice: The River Runs Through the Law School,” Law and Social Inquiry, 25 (Spring 2000), 395-505. See also Bowen and Bok, The Shape of the River, 118-154.

83. Christopher Edley, Jr., Not All Black and White: Affirmative Action and American Values (New York: Hill and Wang, 1996), 132ff. Edley's example involved a coal miner's daughter; I've change the daughter to a son for expository purposes.

84. Charles R. Lawrence III and Mari J. Matsuda, We Won't Go Back: Making the Case for Affirmative Action (Boston: Houghton Mifflin Company, 1997), 199-1.

85. Bernard Boxill has insisted that merely receiving benefits produced by injustice is enough to make one personally liable to compensate the victim of injustice (Bernard Boxill, “The Morality of Reparations,” Social Theory and Practice, 2 [Spring 1972], 113-123). And who is the victim of injustice”“We know that all blacks, lower class, middle class, and upper class, have been wronged by racial injustice” (Bernard Boxill, Blacks and Social Justice [Totowa, New Jersey: Rowman and Allanheld, 1984], 164). In “The Morality of Preferential Hiring,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 7 (Spring 1978), 251, Boxill argues that the correlation between “preferences received” and “compensation deserved,” though not perfect, is very high. A recent piece by D. W. Haslett, “Workplace Discrimination, Good Cause, and Color Blindness,” Journal of Value Inquiry, 36 (2002) also conceives of affirmative action as a way to neutralize “tainted” advantages enjoyed by whites, although he concedes that the neutralization is “extremely rough” (p. 83). Haslett cites none on the literature from the 1970s and 1980s that thoroughly covered this terrain. He is not alone in such forgetfulness.

86. 438 U.S. 265, at 365-6.

87. Michel Rosenfeld, Affirmative Action and Justice: A Philosophical Inquiry (New Haven, Connecticut: Yale University Press, 1991), 307-8. Emphasis added.

88. Lawrence and Matsuda, We Won't Go Back, 252.