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The Chinese Room Argument

First published Fri Mar 19, 2004; substantive revision Mon Mar 22, 2004

The Chinese Room argument, devised by John Searle, is an argument against the possibility of true artificial intelligence. The argument centers on a thought experiment in which someone who knows only English sits alone in a room following English instructions for manipulating strings of Chinese characters, such that to those outside the room it appears as if someone in the room understands Chinese. The argument is intended to show that while suitably programmed computers may appear to converse in natural language, they are not capable of understanding language, even in principle. Searle argues that the thought experiment underscores the fact that computers merely use syntactic rules to manipulate symbol strings, but have no understanding of meaning or semantics. Searle's argument is a direct challenge to proponents of Artificial Intelligence, and the argument also has broad implications for functionalist and computational theories of meaning and of mind. As a result, there have been many critical replies to the argument.

1. Overview

Artificial Intelligence (AI) has produced computer programs that can beat the world chess champion, and programs with which one can converse in natural language. Our experience shows that playing chess and carrying on a conversation are activities that require understanding and intelligence. Does computer prowess at chess and conversation then show that computers can understand and be intelligent? Will further development result in digital computers that fully match human intelligence? Alan Turing (1950), one of the pioneer theoreticians of computing, believed the answer to these questions was "yes". Other workers in AI have thought that computers already understand at least some natural language. Beginning in 1980, philosopher John Searle introduced a short and widely-discussed argument intended to show conclusively that it is impossible for digital computers to understand language or think.

Searle argues that a good way to test a theory of mind, say a theory that holds that understanding can be created by doing such and such, is to imagine what it would be like to do what the theory says would create understanding. Searle (1999) summarized the Chinese Room argument concisely:

Imagine a native English speaker who knows no Chinese locked in a room full of boxes of Chinese symbols (a data base) together with a book of instructions for manipulating the symbols (the program). Imagine that people outside the room send in other Chinese symbols which, unknown to the person in the room, are questions in Chinese (the input). And imagine that by following the instructions in the program the man in the room is able to pass out Chinese symbols which are correct answers to the questions (the output). The program enables the person in the room to pass the Turing Test for understanding Chinese but he does not understand a word of Chinese.

Searle goes on to say, "The point of the argument is this: if the man in the room does not understand Chinese on the basis of implementing the appropriate program for understanding Chinese then neither does any other digital computer solely on that basis because no computer, qua computer, has anything the man does not have."

Searle develops broader implications of his argument. Searle also aims to refute the functionalist approach to understanding minds, especially that form of functionalism known as the Computational Theory of Mind, that treats minds as information processing systems. As a result, the Chinese Room argument has probably been the most widely discussed philosophical argument in cognitive science to appear in the in the past 25 years. By 1991 computer scientist Pat Hayes had defined Cognitive Science as the ongoing research project of refuting Searle's argument. Cognitive psychologist Steven Pinker (1997) pointed out that by the mid-1990s well over 100 articles had been published on Searle's thought experiment — and that discussion of it was so pervasive on the Internet that Pinker found it a compelling reason to remove his name from all Internet discussion lists.

2. Historical Background

2.1 Leibniz’ Mill

Searle's argument has three important antecedents. The first of these is an argument set out by the philosopher and mathematician, Gottfried Leibniz (1646-1716). This argument, often known as "Leibniz’ Mill", appears as section 17 of Leibniz’ Monadology. Like Searle's argument, Leibniz’ argument takes the form of a thought experiment. Leibniz asks us to imagine a physical system, a machine, that behaves in such a way that it supposedly thinks and has experiences ("perception").

17. Moreover, it must be confessed that perception and that which depends upon it are inexplicable on mechanical grounds, that is to say, by means of figures and motions. And supposing there were a machine, so constructed as to think, feel, and have perception, it might be conceived as increased in size, while keeping the same proportions, so that one might go into it as into a mill. That being so, we should, on examining its interior, find only parts which work one upon another, and never anything by which to explain a perception. Thus it is in a simple substance, and not in a compound or in a machine, that perception must be sought for. [Robert Latta translation]

Notice that Leibniz's strategy here is to contrast the overt behavior of the machine, which might display evidence of thought, with the way the machine operates internally. He points out that these internal mechanical operations are just parts moving from point to point, nothing that is conscious or that can explain thinking, feeling or perceiving. For Leibniz physical states are not sufficient for, nor constitutive of, mental states.

2.2 Turing's Paper Machine

A second antecedent to the Chinese Room argument is the idea of a paper machine, a computer implemented by a human. This idea is found in the work of Alan Turing, for example in "Intelligent Machinery" (1948). Turing writes there that he wrote a program for a "paper machine" to play chess. A paper machine is a kind of program, a series of simple steps like a computer program, but written in natural language (e.g., English), and followed by a human. The human operator of the paper chess-playing machine need not (otherwise) know how to play chess. All the operator does is follow the instructions for generating moves on the chess board. In fact, the operator need not even know that he or she is involved in playing chess — the input and output strings, such as "QKP2 - QKP3" need mean nothing to the operator of the paper machine.

Turing was optimistic that computers themselves would soon be able to exhibit apparently intelligent behavior, answering questions posed in English and carrying on conversations. Turing (1950) proposed what is now known as the Turing Test: if a computer could pass for human in on-line chat, it should be counted as intelligent. By the late 1970s, as computers became faster and less expensive, some in the AI community claimed that their programs could understand English sentences, using a database of background information. The work of one of these, Yale researcher Roger Schank (Schank & Abelson 1977) came to the attention of John Searle. Schank developed a technique called "conceptual representation" that used "scripts" to represent conceptual relations. Searle's argument was originally presented as a response to the claim that AI programs such as Schank's literally understand the sentences that they respond to.

2.3 The Chinese Nation

A third more immediate antecedent to the Chinese Room argument emerged in early discussion of functionalist theories of minds and cognition. Critics of functionalism were quick to turn its proclaimed virtue of multiple realizability against it. In contrast with type-type identity theory, functionalism allowed beings with different physiology to have the same types of mental states as humans — pains, for example. But it was pointed out that if aliens could realize the functional properties that constituted mental states, then, presumably so could systems even less like human brains. The computational form of functionalism is particularly vulnerable to this maneuver, since a wide variety of systems with simple components are computationally equivalent (see e.g., Maudlin 1989 for a computer built from buckets of water). Critics asked if it was really plausible that these inorganic systems had mental states.

Daniel Dennett (1978) reports that in 1974 Lawrence Davis gave a colloquium at MIT in which he presented one such unorthodox implementation. Dennett summarizes Davis' thought experiment as follows:

Let a functionalist theory of pain (whatever its details) be instantiated by a system the subassemblies of which are not such things as C-fibers and reticular systems but telephone lines and offices staffed by people. Perhaps it is a giant robot controlled by an army of human beings that inhabit it. When the theory's functionally characterized conditions for pain are now met we must say, if the theory is true, that the robot is in pain. That is, real pain, as real as our own, would exist in virtue of the perhaps disinterested and businesslike activities of these bureaucratic teams, executing their proper functions.

In “Troubles with Functionalism”, also published in 1978, Ned Block envisions the entire population of China implementing the functions of neurons in the brain. This scenario has subsequently been called "The Chinese Nation" or "The Chinese Gym". We can suppose that every Chinese citizen would be given a call-list of phone numbers, and at a preset time on implementation day, designated “input” citizens would initiate the process by calling those on their call-list. When any citizen's phone rang, he or she would then phone those on his or her list, who would in turn contact yet others. No phone message need be exchanged; all that is required is the pattern of calling. The call-lists would be constructed in such a way that the patterns of calls implemented the same patterns of activation that occur in someone's brain when that person is in a mental state — pain, for example. The phone calls play the same functional role as neurons causing one another to fire. Block was primarily interested in qualia, and in particular, whether it is plausible to hold that the population of China might collectively be in pain, while no individual member of the population experienced any pain.

Thus Block's precursor thought experiment, as with those of Davis and Dennett, is a system of many humans rather than one. The focus is on consciousness, but to the extent that Searle's argument also involves consciousness, the thought experiment is closely related to Searle's.

3. The Chinese Room Argument

In 1980, John Searle published "Minds, Brains and Programs" in the journal The Behavioral and Brain Sciences. In this article, Searle sets out the argument, and then replies to the half-dozen main objections that had been raised during his presentations at various university campuses (see next section). In addition, Searle's article in BBS was published along with comments and criticisms by 27 cognitive science researchers. These 27 comments were followed by Searle's replies to his critics.

Over the last two decades of the twentieth century, the Chinese Room argument was the subject of very many discussions. By 1984, Searle presented the Chinese Room argument in a book, Minds, Brains and Science. In January 1990, the popular periodical Scientific American took the debate to a general scientific audience. Searle included the Chinese Room Argument in his contribution, "Is the Brain's Mind a Computer Program?" His piece was followed by a responding article, "Could a Machine Think?", written by Paul and Patricia Churchland. Soon thereafter Searle had a published exchange about the Chinese Room with another leading philosopher, Jerry Fodor (in Rosenthal (ed.) 1991).

The heart of the argument is an imagined human simulation of a computer, similar to Turing's Paper Machine. The human in the Chinese Room follows English instructions for manipulating Chinese symbols, where a computer "follows" a program written in a computing language. The human produces the appearance of understanding Chinese by following the symbol manipulating instructions, but does not thereby come to understand Chinese. Since a computer just does what the human does — manipulate symbols on the basis of their syntax alone - no computer, merely by following a program, comes to genuinely understand Chinese.

This narrow argument, based closely on the Chinese Room scenario, is directed at a position Searle calls "Strong AI". Strong AI is the view that suitably programmed computers (or the programs themselves) can understand natural language and actually have other mental capabilities similar to the humans whose abilities they mimic. According to Strong AI, a computer may play chess intelligently, make a clever move, or understand language. By contrast, "weak AI" is the view that computers are merely useful in psychology, linguistics, and other areas, in part because they can simulate mental abilities. But weak AI makes no claim that computers actually understand or are intelligent. The Chinese Room argument is not directed at weak AI, nor does it purport to show that machines cannot think — Searle says that brains are machines, and brains think. It is directed at the view that formal computations on symbols can produce thought.

We might summarize the narrow argument as a reductio ad absurdum against Strong AI as follows. Let L be a natural language, and let us say that a "program for L" is a program for conversing fluently in L. A computing system is any system, human or otherwise, that can run a program.

(1) If Strong AI is true, then there is a program for Chinese such that if any computing system runs that program, that system thereby comes to understand Chinese.
(2) I could run a program for Chinese without thereby coming to understand Chinese.
(3) Therefore Strong AI is false.

The second premise is supported by the Chinese Room thought experiment. The conclusion of this narrow argument is that running a program cannot create understanding. The wider argument includes the claim that the thought experiment shows more generally that one cannot get semantics (meaning) from syntax (formal symbol manipulation). That and related issues are discussed in the section The Larger Philosophical Issues.

4. Replies to the Chinese Room Argument

Criticisms of the narrow Chinese Room argument against Strong AI have often followed three main lines, which can be distinguished by how much they concede:

(1) Some critics concede that the man in the room doesn't understand Chinese, but hold that at the same time there is some other thing that does understand. These critics object to the inference from the claim that the man in the room does not understand Chinese to the conclusion that nothing in the room understands Chinese. There might be understanding by a larger, or different, system. This is the strategy of The Systems Reply and the Virtual Mind Reply. These replies hold that there could be understanding in the original Chinese Room scenario.

(2) Other critics concede Searle's claim that just running a natural language processing program as described in the CR scenario does not create any understanding, whether by a human or a computer system. But these critics hold that a variation on the computer system could understand. The variant might be a computer embedded in a robotic body, having interaction with the physical world via sensors and motors ("The Robot Reply"), or it might be a system that simulated the detailed operation of an entire brain, neuron by neuron ("the Brain Simulator Reply").

(3) Finally, some critics do not concede even the narrow point against AI. These critics hold that the man in the original Chinese Room scenario might understand Chinese, despite Searle's denials. For example, critics have argued that our intuitions in such cases are unreliable. Other critics have held that it all depends on what one means by "understand" — points discussed in the section on the Intuition Reply. And finally some have argued that if it is not reasonable to attribute understanding on the basis of the behavior exhibited by the Chinese Room, then it would not be reasonable to attribute understanding to humans on the basis of similar behavioral evidence (Searle calls this last the "Other Minds Reply").

In addition to these responses specifically to the Chinese Room scenario and the narrow argument to be discussed here, critics also independently argue against Searle's larger claim, and hold that one can get semantics (that is, meaning) from syntactic symbol manipulation, including the sort that takes place inside a digital computer, a question discussed in the section on syntax and semantics.

4.1 The Systems Reply

In the original BBS article, Searle identified and discussed several responses to the argument that he had come across in giving the argument in talks at various places. As a result, these responses have received the most attention. What Searle calls "perhaps the most common reply" is the Systems Reply.

The Systems Reply, which Searle says was originally associated with Yale, concedes that the man in the room does not understand Chinese. But, the reply continues, the man is but a part, a central processing unit (CPU), in a larger system. The larger system includes the memory (scratchpads) containing intermediate states, and the instructions — the complete system that is required for answering the Chinese questions. While the man running the program does not understand Chinese, the system as a whole does.

Ned Block was one of the first to press the Systems Reply, along with many others including Jack Copeland, Daniel Dennett, Jerry Fodor, John Haugeland, Ray Kurzweil and Georges Rey. Rey (1986) says the person in the room is just the CPU of the system. Kurzweil (2002) says that the human being is just an implementer and of no significance (presumably meaning that the properties of the implementer are not necessarily those of the system). Kurzweil holds that if the system displays the apparent capacity to understand Chinese "it would have to, indeed, understand Chinese" — Searle is contradicting himself in saying in effect, "the machine speaks speaks Chinese but doesn't understand Chinese".

Margaret Boden (1988) raises levels considerations. “Computational psychology does not credit the brain with seeing bean-sprouts or understanding English: intentional states such as these are properties of people, not of brains” (244). “In short, Searle's description of the robot's pseudo-brain (that is, of Searle-in-the-robot) as understanding English involves a category-mistake comparable to treating the brain as the bearer, as opposed to the causal basis, of intelligence”. Boden (1988) and Cole (1984) point out that the room operator is a conscious agent, while the CPU in a computer is not — the Chinese Room scenario asks us to take the perspective of the implementer, and not surprisingly finds differences.

Searle's response to the Systems Reply is simple: in principle, the man can internalize the entire system, memorizing all the instructions, doing all the calculations in his head. He could then leave the room and wander outdoors, perhaps even conversing in Chinese. But he still would have no way to attach "any meaning to the formal symbols". The man would now be the entire system, yet he still would not understand Chinese. For example, he would not know the meaning of the Chinese word for hamburger. He still cannot get semantics from syntax. (See below the section on Syntax and Semantics).

In his 2002 paper “The Chinese Room from a Logical Point of View”, Jack Copeland considers Searle's response to the Systems Reply and argues that a homunculus inside Searle's head might understand even though the room operator himself does not, just as modules in minds solve tensor equations that enable us to catch cricket balls. Copeland then turns to consider the Chinese Gym, and again appears to endorse the Systems Reply: “…the individual players [do not] understand Chinese. But there is no entailment from this to the claim that the simulation as a whole does not come to understand Chinese. The fallacy involved in moving from part to whole is even more glaring here than in the original version of the Chinese Room Argument”. Copeland denies that connectionism implies that a room of people can simulate the brain.

John Haugeland writes (2002) that Searle's response to the Systems Reply is flawed: “…what he now asks is what it would be like if he, in his own mind, were consciously to implement the underlying formal structures and operations that the theory says are sufficient to implement another mind”. According to Haugeland, his failure to understand Chinese is irrelevant: he is just the implementer. The larger system implemented would understand — there is a level-of-description fallacy.

Steven Harnad has defended Searle's argument against Systems Reply critics in two papers. In his 1989 paper, Harnad writes “Searle formulates the problem as follows: Is the mind a computer program? Or, more specifically, if a computer program simulates or imitates activities of ours that seem to require understanding (such as communicating in language), can the program itself be said to understand in so doing?” (Note the specific claim: the issue is taken to be whether the program itself understands.) Harnad concludes: “On the face of it, [the CR argument] looks valid. It certainly works against the most common rejoinder, the "Systems Reply"….”

4.1.1 The Virtual Mind Reply

The Systems Reply holds that understanding is not a property of the CPU or the man in the Chinese Room, but of the larger system that consists of the physical computer (man or machine), its program, and its database. The Virtual Mind Reply is related in that it denies that the mind that understands is identical with the man in the Chinese Room, but it holds that the entity that understands is more abstract than the computing system. The Virtual Mind Reply uses as one of its models the relation between a computing system and a virtual machine. A single computing system can realize one or multiple virtual machines that can have quite different properties from each other and from the properties of the underlying realizing computing system. For example, the realizing system may natively respond to or "understand" one instruction set, the realized machines each to a different instruction set. The realizing system may be fast, the realized system slow. The realized system may cease to exist while the underlying system continues to exist. The Virtual Mind Reply does not appear to be liable to Searle's response to the System Reply, that he might internalize all aspects of the system yet still not understand Chinese: the VM reply distinguishes between mind and realizing system.

Minsky (1980) and Sloman and Croucher (1980) suggested a Virtual Mind reply when the Chinese Room argument first appeared. In his widely-read 1989 paper "Computation and Consciousness", Tim Maudlin considers minimal physical systems that might implement a computational system running a program. His discussion revolves around his imaginary Olympia machine, a system of buckets that transfers water, implementing a Turing machine. Maudlin's main target is the computationalists' claim that such a machine could have phenomenal consciousness. However in the course of his discussion, Maudlin considers the Chinese Room argument. Maudlin (citing Minsky, and Sloman and Croucher) points out a Virtual Mind reply that the agent that understands could be distinct from the physical system (414). Thus "Searle has done nothing to discount the possibility of simultaneously existing disjoint mentalities" (414-5).

Perlis (1992), Chalmers (1996) and Block (2002) have apparently endorsed versions of a Virtual Mind reply as well, as has Richard Hanley in The Metaphysics of Star Trek (1997). Penrose (2002) is a critic of this strategy, and Stevan Harnad scornfully dismisses such heroic resorts to metaphysics. Harnad defended Searle's position in a “Virtual Symposium on Virtual Minds” (1992) against Patrick Hayes and Don Perlis. Perlis pressed a virtual minds argument derived, he says, from Maudlin. Chalmers (1996) notes that the room operator is just a causal facilitator, a “demon”, so that his states of consciousness are irrelevant to the properties of the system as a whole. Like Maudlin, Chalmers raises issues of personal identity — we might regard the Chinese Room as “two mental systems realized within the same physical space. The organization that gives rise to the Chinese experiences is quite distinct from the organization that gives rise to the demon's experiences”(326).

Cole (1991, 1994) develops the reply most extensively and argues as follows: Searle's argument presupposes, and requires, that the agent of understanding be the computer itself or, in the Chinese Room parallel, the person in the room. Searle's failure to understand Chinese in the room does not show that there is no understanding being created. Cole argues that the mental traits that constitute John Searle, his beliefs and desires, memories and personality traits — are all irrelevant and causally inert in producing the answers to the Chinese questions. If understanding of Chinese were created by running the program, the mind understanding the Chinese would not be the computer, nor, in the Chinese Room, would the person understanding Chinese be the room operator. The person understanding the Chinese would be a distinct person from the room operator. The reason is that the personality and memories of the Chinese understanding person would not be John Searle's personality and memories. The personality and memories, beliefs and desires, of the agent understanding Chinese would all depend on the programming, and the structure of the enormous database that it will have to draw upon in order to pass the Turing Test — it would not be John Searle's personality, memories, beliefs or desires. So if the activity in the room creates any understanding, it would not be John Searle's understanding. We can say that a virtual person who understands Chinese would be created by running the program.

Cole (1991) offers an additional argument that the mind doing the understanding is neither the mind of the room operator nor the system consisting of the operator and the program: running a suitably structured computer program might produce answers submitted in Chinese and also answers to questions submitted in Korean. Yet the Chinese answers might apparently display completely different knowledge and memories, beliefs and desires than the answers to the Korean questions — along with a denial that the Chinese answerer knows any Korean, and vice versa. Thus the evidence would be that there were two non-identical minds (one understanding Chinese only, and one understanding Korean only). Since these might have mutually exclusive psychological properties, they cannot be identical, and ipso facto, cannot be identical with the mind of the implementer in the room. Thus Searle's failure to understand Chinese in the room, in all its variants, shows nothing about the limits of AI, whether in the form of old-fashioned symbols and rules systems, or distributed processing connectionist systems. The implication seems to be that minds generally are more abstract than the systems that realize them (see Mind and Body in the Larger Philosophical Issues section).

In short, the Virtual Mind argument is that since the evidence that Searle provides that there is no understanding of Chinese was that he wouldn't understand Chinese in the room, the Chinese Room Argument cannot refute a differently formulated equally strong AI claim, asserting the possibility of creating understanding using a programmed digital computer. Maudlin (1989) says that Searle has not adequately responded to this criticism.

Others however have replied to the Virtual Mind claim, including Stevan Harnad and mathematical physicist Roger Penrose. Penrose is generally sympathetic to the points Searle raises with the Chinese Room argument, and has argued against the Virtual Mind reply. Penrose does not believe that computational processes can account for consciousness, both on Chinese Room grounds, as well as because of limitations on formal systems revealed by Kurt Gödel's incompleteness proof. (Penrose has two books on mind and consciousness; Chalmers and others have responded to Penrose's appeals to Gödel.) In his 2002 article “Consciousness, Computation, and the Chinese Room” that specifically addresses the Chinese Room argument, Penrose argues that the Chinese Gym variation — with a room expanded to the size of India, with Indians doing the processing — shows it is very implausible to hold there is “some kind of disembodied ‘understanding’ associated with the person's carrying out of that algorithm, and whose presence does not impinge in any way upon his own consciousness” (230-1). Penrose concludes the Chinese Room argument refutes Strong AI.

4.2 The Robot Reply

The Robot Reply concedes Searle is right about the Chinese Room scenario: it shows that a computer trapped in a computer room cannot understand language, or know what words mean. The Robot reply is responsive to the problem of knowing the meaning of the Chinese word for hamburger — Searle's example of something the room operator would not know. It seems reasonable to hold that we know what a hamburger is because we have seen one, and perhaps even made one, or tasted one, or at least heard people talk about hamburgers and understood what they are by relating them to things we do know by seeing, making, and tasting. Given this is how one might come to know what hamburgers are, the Robot Reply suggests that we put a digital computer in a robot body, with sensors, such as video cameras and microphones, and add effectors, such as wheels to move around with, and arms with which to manipulate things in the world. Such a robot — a computer with a body — could do what a child does, learn by seeing and doing. The Robot Reply holds that such a digital computer in a robot body, freed from the room, could attach meanings to symbols and actually understand natural language. Margaret Boden, Tim Crane, Daniel Dennett, Jerry Fodor, Stevan Harnad, Hans Moravec and Georges Rey are among those who have endorsed versions of this reply at one time or another.

Searle does not think this reply to the Chinese Room argument is any stronger than the Systems Reply. All the sensors do is provide additional input to the computer — and it will be just syntactic input. We can see this by making a parallel change to the Chinese Room scenario. Suppose the man in the Chinese Room receives, in addition to the Chinese characters slipped under the door, a stream of numerals that appear, say, on a ticker tape in a corner of the room. The instruction books are augmented to use the numbers from the tape as input, along with the Chinese characters. Unbeknownst to the man in the room, the numbers in the tape are the digitized output of a video camera. Searle argues that additional syntactic inputs will do nothing to allow the man to associate meanings with the Chinese characters. It is just more work for the man in the room.

Jerry Fodor, with Hilary Putnam and David Lewis, was a principle architect of the computational theory of mind that Searle's wider argument attacks. In his original 1980 reply to Searle, Fodor allows Searle is certainly right that “instantiating the same program as the brain does is not, in and of itself, sufficient for having those propositional attitudes characteristic of the organism that has the brain.” But Fodor holds that Searle is wrong about the robot reply. A computer might have propositional attitudes if it has the right causal connections to the world — but those are not ones mediated by a man sitting in the head of the robot. We don't know what the right causal connections are. Searle commits the fallacy of inferring from “the little man is not the right causal connection” to conclude that no causal linkage would succeed. There is considerable empirical evidence that mental processes involve “manipulation of symbols”; Searle give us no alternative explanation (this is sometimes called Fodor's “Only Game in Town” argument for computational approaches). Since this time, Fodor has written extensively on what the connections must be between a brain state and the world for the state to have intentional (representational) properties.

In a later piece, “Yin and Yang in the Chinese Room” (in Rosenthal 1991 pp.524-525), Fodor substantially revises his 1980 view. He distances himself from his earlier version of the robot reply, and holds instead that “instantiation” should be defined in such a way that the symbol must be the proximate cause of the effect — no intervening guys in a room. So Searle in the room is not an instantiation of a Turing Machine, and “Searle's setup does not instantiate the machine that the brain instantiates.” He concludes: “…Searle's setup is irrelevant to the claim that strong equivalence to a Chinese speaker's brain is ipso facto sufficient for speaking Chinese.” Searle says of Fodor's move, “Of all the zillions of criticisms of the Chinese Room argument, Fodor's is perhaps the most desperate. He claims that precisely because the man in the Chinese room sets out to implement the steps in the computer program, he is not implementing the steps in the computer program. He offers no argument for this extraordinary claim.” (in Rosenthal 1991, p. 525)

In a 1986 paper, Georges Rey advocated a combination of the system and robot reply, after noting that the original Turing Test is insufficient as a test of intelligence and understanding, and that the isolated system Searle describes in the room is certainly not functionally equivalent to a real Chinese speaker sensing and acting in the world. In a 2002 second look, “Searle's Misunderstandings of Functionalism and Strong AI”, Rey again defends functionalism against Searle, and in the particular form Rey calls the “computational-representational theory of thought — CRTT”. CRTT is not committed to attributing thought to just any system that passes the Turing Test (like the Chinese Room). Nor is it committed to a conversation manual model of understanding natural language. Rather, CRTT is concerned with intentionality, natural and artificial (the representations in the system are semantically evaluable — they are true or false, hence have aboutness). Searle saddles functionalism with the “blackbox” character of behaviorism, but functionalism cares how things are done. Rey sketches “a modest mind” — a CRTT system that has perception, can make deductive and inductive inferences, makes decisions on basis of goals and representations of how the world is, and can process natural language by converting to and from its native representations. To explain the behavior of such a system we would need to use the same attributions needed to explain the behavior of a normal Chinese speaker.

Tim Crane discusses the Chinese Room argument in his 1991 book, The Mechanical Mind. He cites the Churchlands' luminous room analogy, but then goes on to argue that in the course of operating the room, Searle would learn the meaning of the Chinese: “…if Searle had not just memorized the rules and the data, but also started acting in the world of Chinese people, then it is plausible that he would before too long come to realize what these symbols mean.”(127). (It is not clear if Crane realizes that any such realizing would arguably not be by the symbol manipulating system, but by the mind of the implementer.) Crane appears to end with a version of the Robot Reply: “Searle's argument itself begs the question by (in effect) just denying the central thesis of AI — that thinking is formal symbol manipulation. But Searle's assumption, none the less, seems to me correct ... the proper response to Searle's argument is: sure, Searle-in-the-room, or the room alone, cannot understand Chinese. But if you let the outside world have some impact on the room, meaning or ‘semantics' might begin to get a foothold. But of course, this concedes that thinking cannot be simply symbol manipulation.” (129)

Margaret Boden 1988 also argues that Searle mistakenly supposes programs are pure syntax. But programs bring about the activity of certain machines: “The inherent procedural consequences of any computer program give it a toehold in semantics, where the semantics in question is not denotational, but causal.” (250) Thus a robot might have causal powers that enable it to refer to a restaurant.

Steven Harnad also finds important our sensory and motor capabilities: “Who is to say that the Turing Test, whether conducted in Chinese or in any other language, could be successfully passed without operations that draw on our sensory, motor, and other higher cognitive capacities as well? Where does the capacity to comprehend Chinese begin and the rest of our mental competence leave off?” Harnad believes that symbolic functions must be grounded in “robotic” functions that connect a system with the world. And he thinks this counts against symbolic accounts of mentality, such as Jerry Fodor's, and, one suspects, the approach of Roger Schank that was Searle's original target.

4.3 The Brain Simulator Reply

Consider a computer that operates in quite a different manner than the usual AI program with scripts and operations on strings of linguistic symbols. Suppose instead the program simulates the actual sequence of nerve firings that occur in the brain of a native Chinese language speaker when that person understands Chinese — every nerve, every firing. Since the computer then works the very same way as the brain of a native Chinese speaker, processing information in just the same way, it will understand Chinese. Paul and Patricia Churchland have set out a reply along these lines.

In response to this, Searle argues that it makes no difference. He suggests a variation on the brain simulator scenario: suppose that in the room the man has a huge set of valves and water pipes, in the same arrangement as the neurons in a native Chinese speaker's brain. The program now tells the man which valves to open in response to input. Searle claims that it is obvious that there would be no understanding of Chinese. A simulation of brain activity is not the real thing. Searle's response is close to the scenarios in Leibniz’ Mill and the Chinese Gym (see also Maudlin 1989).

Under the rubric "The Combination Reply", Searle also considers a system with the features of all three of the preceding: a robot with a digital brain simulating computer in its cranium, such that the system as a whole behaves indistinguishably from a human. Since the normal input to the brain is from sense organs, it is natural to suppose that most advocates of the Brain Simulator Reply have in mind such a combination of brain simulation, Robot, and Systems Reply. Some (e.g. Rey 1986) argue it is reasonable to attribute intentionality to such a system as a whole. Searle agrees that it would be reasonable to attribute understanding to such an android system — but only as long as you don't know how it works. As soon as you know the truth — it is a computer, uncomprehendingly manipulating symbols on the basis of syntax, not meaning — you would cease to attribute intentionality to it.

(One assumes this would be true even if it were one's spouse, with whom one had built a life-long relationship, that was revealed to hide a silicon secret. Science fiction stories, including episodes of Rod Serling's television series The Twilight Zone, have been based on such possibilities; Steven Pinker (1997) mentions one episode in which the secret was known from the start, but the protagonist developed a romantic relationship with the android.)

On its tenth anniversary the Chinese Room argument was featured in the general science periodical Scientific American. Leading the opposition to Searle's lead article in that issue were philosophers Paul and Patricia Churchland. The Churchlands agree with Searle that the Chinese Room does not understand Chinese, but hold that the argument itself exploits our ignorance of cognitive and semantic phenomena. They raise a parallel case of “The Luminous Room” where someone waves a magnet and argues that the absence of resulting visible light shows that Maxwell's electromagnetic theory is false. The Churchlands advocate a view of the brain as a connectionist system, a vector transformer, not a system manipulating symbols according to structure-sensitive rules. The system in the Chinese Room uses the wrong computational strategies. Thus they agree with Searle against traditional AI, but presumably would endorse what Searle calls “the Brain Simulator Reply”, arguing that, as with the Luminous Room, our intuitions fail us when considering such a complex system, and it is a fallacy to move from part to whole: “… no neuron in my brain understands English, although my whole brain does.”

In his 1991 book, Microcognition. Clark holds that Searle is right that a computer running Schank's program does not know anything about restaurants, “at least if by ‘know’ we mean anything like ‘understand’”. But Searle thinks that this would apply to any computational model, while Clark holds that Searle is wrong about connectionist models. Clark's interest is thus in the brain-simulator reply. The brain thinks in virtue of its physical properties. What physical properties of the brain are important? Clark answers that what is important about brains are “variable and flexible substructures” which conventional AI systems lack. But that doesn't mean computationalism or functionalism is false. It depends on what level you take the functional units to be. Clark defends “microfunctionalism” - one should look to a fine-grained functional description, e.g. neural net level. Clark cites William Lycan approvingly contra Block's absent qualia objection — yes, there can be absent qualia, if the functional units are made large. But that does not constitute a refutation of functionalism generally. So Clark's views are not unlike the Churchlands', conceding that Searle is right about Schank and symbolic-level processing systems, but holding that he is mistaken about connectionist systems.

Similarly Ray Kurzweil (2002) argues that Searle's argument could be turned around to show that human brains cannot understand — the brain succeeds by manipulating neurotransmitter concentrations and other mechanisms that are in themselves meaningless. In criticism of Searle's response to the Brain Simulator Reply, Kurzweil says: “So if we scale up Searle's Chinese Room to be the rather massive “room” it needs to be, who's to say that the entire system of a hundred trillion people simulating a Chinese Brain that knows Chinese isn't conscious? Certainly, it would be correct to say that such a system knows Chinese. And we can't say that it is not conscious anymore than we can say that about any other process. We can't know the subjective experience of another entity…” Kurzweil concludes caustically: “Searle is a master of combining tautologies and contradictions in the same argument, but his illogical reasoning to the effect that machines that demonstrate understanding have no understanding does nothing to alter these rapidly accelerating developments."

4.4 The Other Minds Reply

Related to the preceding is The Other Minds Reply: "How do you know that other people understand Chinese or anything else? Only by their behavior. Now the computer can pass the behavioral tests as well as they can (in principle), so if you are going to attribute cognition to other people you must in principle also attribute it to computers. "

Searle's reply to this is very short: we presuppose that other people have minds in our dealings with them, just as in physics we presuppose the existence of objects. Critics hold that if the evidence we have that humans understand is the same as the evidence we might have that a visiting alien understands, which is the same as the evidence that a robot understands, the presuppositions we may make in the case of our own species are not relevant, for presuppositions are sometimes false. An example of this is in the previously mentioned story quoted by Steven Pinker where aliens presuppose that anything made of meat cannot really think. For similar reasons, Turing, in proposing the Turing Test, is specifically worried about our presuppositions and chauvinism. If the reasons for the presuppositions regarding humans are pragmatic, in that they enable us to predict the behavior of humans and to interact effectively with them, perhaps the presupposition could apply equally to computer (similar considerations are pressed by Dennett, in his discussions of what he calls the Intentional Stance).

Hans Moravec, director of the Robotics laboratory at Carnegie Mellon University, and author of Robot: Mere Machine to Transcendent Mind, argues that Searle's position merely reflects intuitions from traditional philosophy of mind that are out of step with the new cognitive science. Moravec endorses a version of the Other Minds reply. It makes sense to attribute intentionality to machines for the same reasons it makes sense to attribute them to humans; his “interpretative position” is similar to the views of Daniel Dennett. Moravec goes on to note that one of the things we attribute to others is the ability to make attributions of intentionality, and then we make such attributions to ourselves. It is such self-representation that is at the heart of consciousness.

Presumably the reason that Searle thinks we can disregard the evidence in the case of robots and computers is that we know that their processing is syntactic, and this fact trumps all other considerations. Indeed, Searle believes this is the larger point that the Chinese Room merely illustrates. This larger point is addressed in the Syntax and Semantics section below.

4.5 The Intuition Reply

Many responses to the Chinese Room argument have noted that, as with Leibniz’ Mill, the argument appears to be based on intuition: the intuition that a computer (or the man in the room) cannot think or have understanding. For example, Ned Block (1980) in his original BBS commentary says "Searle's argument depends for its force on intuitions that certain entities do not think." But, Block argues, (1) intuitions sometimes can and should be trumped and (2) perhaps we need to bring our concept of understanding in line with a reality in which certain computer robots belong to the same natural kind as humans. Similarly Margaret Boden (1988) points out that we can't trust our untutored intuitions about how mind depends on matter; developments in science may change our intuitions. Indeed, elimination of bias in our intuitions was what motivated Turing (1950) to propose the Turing Test, a test that was blind to the physical character of the system replying to questions. Some of Searle's critics in effect argue that he has merely pushed the reliance on intuition back, into the room.

Critics argue that our intuitions regarding both intelligence and understanding may be unreliable, and perhaps incompatible even with current science. With regard to understanding, Steven Pinker, in How the Mind Works (1997), holds that “… Searle is merely exploring facts about the English word understand.... People are reluctant to use the word unless certain stereotypical conditions apply..." But, Pinker claims, nothing scientifically speaking is at stake. Pinker objects to Searle's appeal to the “causal powers of the brain” by noting that the apparent locus of the causal powers is the “patterns of interconnectivity that carry out the right information processing”. Pinker ends his discussion by citing a science fiction story in which Aliens, anatomically quite unlike humans, cannot believe that humans think with meat in their heads. The Aliens' intuitions are unreliable — presumably ours may be so as well.

Other critics are also concerned with how our understanding of understanding bears on the Chinese Room argument. In their paper "A Chinese Room that Understands" AI researchers Simon and Eisenstadt (2002) argue that whereas Searle refutes "logical strong AI", the thesis that a program that passes the Turing Test will necessarily understand, Searle's argument does not impugn "Empirical Strong AI" — the thesis that it is possible to program a computer that convincingly satisfies ordinary criteria of understanding. They hold however that it is impossible to settle these questions "without employing a definition of the term ‘understand’ that can provide a test for judging whether the hypothesis is true or false". They cite W.V.O.Quine's Word and Object as showing that there is always empirical uncertainty in attributing understanding to humans. As described, the Chinese Room is a Clever Hans trick (Clever Hans was a horse who appeared to clomp out the answers to simple arithmetic questions, but it was discovered that Hans could detect unconscious cues from his trainer). Similarly, the man in the room doesn't understand Chinese, and could be exposed by watching him closely. (Simon and Eisenstadt do not explain just how this would be done, or how it would affect the argument.) Citing the work of Rudolf Carnap, Simon and Eisenstadt argue that to understand it not just to exhibit certain behavior, but to use "intensions" that determine extensions, and that one can see in actual programs that they do use appropriate intensions. They discuss three actual AI programs, and defend various attributions of mentality to them, including understanding, and conclude that computers understand; they learn "intensions by associating words and other linguistic structure with their denotations, as detected through sensory stimuli". And since we can see exactly how the machines work, "it is, in fact, easier to establish that a machine exhibits understanding that to establish that a human exhibits understanding....." Thus, they conclude, the evidence for empirical strong AI is overwhelming.

Similarly, Daniel Dennett in his original 1980 response to Searle's argument called it "an intuition pump". In a later paper, Dennett elaborated on concerns about our intuitions regarding intelligence. Dennett 1987 ("Fast Thinking") expressed concerns about the slow speed at which the Chinese Room would operate, and he has been joined by several other commentators, including Tim Maudlin, David Chalmers, and Steven Pinker. The operator of the Chinese Room may eventually produce appropriate answers to Chinese questions. But slow thinkers are stupid, not intelligent — and in the wild, they may well end up dead. Dennett argues that "speed … is ‘of the essence’ for intelligence. If you can't figure out the relevant portions of the changing environment fast enough to fend for yourself, you are not practically intelligent, however complex you are" (326). Thus Dennett relativizes intelligence to processing speed relative to current environment. Tim Maudlin (1989) disagrees. Maudlin considers the time-scale problem pointed to by other writers, and concludes, contra Dennett, that the extreme slowness of a computational system does not violate any necessary conditions on thinking or consciousness.

Steven Pinker (1997) also holds that Searle relies on untutored intuitions. Pinker endorses the Churchlands' (1990) counterexample of an analogous thought experiment of waving a magnet and not generating light, noting that this outcome would not disprove Maxwell's theory that light consists of electromagnetic waves. Pinker holds that the key issue is speed: "The thought experiment slows down the waves to a range to which we humans no longer see them as light. By trusting our intuitions in the thought experiment, we falsely conclude that rapid waves cannot be light either. Similarly, Searle has slowed down the mental computations to a range in which we humans no longer think of it as understanding (since understanding is ordinarily much faster)" (94-95). Howard Gardiner, a supporter of Searle's conclusions regarding the room, makes a similar point about understanding. Gardiner addresses the Chinese Room argument in his book The Mind's New Science (1985, 171-177). Gardiner considers all the standard replies to the Chinese Room argument and concludes that Searle is correct about the room: “…the word understand has been unduly stretched in the case of the Chinese room ….” (175).

Thus several in this group of critics argue that speed affects our willingness to attribute intelligence and understanding to a slow system, such as that in the Chinese Room. The result may simply be that our intuitions regarding the Chinese Room are unreliable, and thus the man in the room, in implementing the program, may understand Chinese despite intuitions to the contrary (Maudlin and Pinker). Or it may be that the slowness marks a crucial difference between the simulation in the room and what a fast computer does, such that the man is not intelligent while the computer system is (Dennett).

5. The Larger Philosophical Issues

5.1 Syntax and Semantics

Searle believes the Chinese Room argument supports a larger point, which explains the failure of the Chinese Room to produce understanding. Searle argued that programs implemented by computers are just syntactical. Computer operations are "formal" in that they respond only to the explicit form of the strings of symbols, not to the meaning of the symbols. Minds on the other hand have states with meaning, mental contents. We associate meanings with the words or signs in language. We respond to signs because of their meaning, not just their physical appearance. In short, we understand. But, and according to Searle this is the key point, "Syntax is not by itself sufficient for, nor constitutive of, semantics." So although computers may be able to manipulate syntax to produce appropriate responses to natural language input, they do not understand the sentences they receive or output, for they cannot associate meanings with the words.

Searle (1984 etc.) presents a three premise argument that because syntax is not sufficient for semantics, programs cannot produce minds.

  1. Programs are purely formal (syntactic).
  2. Human minds have mental contents (semantics).
  3. Syntax by itself is neither constitutive of, nor sufficient for, semantic content.
  4. Therefore, programs by themselves are not constitutive of nor sufficient for minds.

The Chinese Room thought experiment itself is the support for the third premise. The claim that syntactic manipulation is not sufficient for meaning or thought is a significant issue, with wider implications than AI, or attributions of understanding. Prominent theories of mind hold that human cognition generally is computational. In one form, it is held that thought involves operations on symbols in virtue of their physical properties. On an alternative connectionist account, the computations are on "subsymbolic" states. If Searle is right, not only Strong AI but also these main approaches to understanding human cognition are misguided.

As we have seen, Searle holds that the Chinese Room scenario shows that one cannot get semantics from syntax alone. In formal systems, rules are given for syntax, and this procedure appears to be quite independent of semantics. One specifies the basic symbol set and some rules for manipulating strings to produce new ones. These rules are purely formal or syntactic — they are applied to strings of symbols solely in virtue of their syntax or form. A semantics, if any, for the symbol system must be provided separately. And if one wishes to show that interesting additional relationships hold between the syntactic operations and semantics, such as that the symbol manipulations preserve truth, one must provide sometimes complex meta-proofs to show this. So on the face of it, semantics is quite independent of syntax for artificial languages, and one cannot get semantics from syntax alone. "Formal symbols by themselves can never be enough for mental contents, because the symbols, by definition, have no meaning (or interpretation, or semantics) except insofar as someone outside the system gives it to them" (Searle 1989, 45).

Searle's point is clearly true of the formal systems of logicians. When we move from formal systems to computational systems, the situation is more complex. As many of Searle's critics (e.g. Cole 1984, Dennett 1987, Boden 1988, and Chalmers 1996) have noted, a computer running a program is not the same as "syntax alone". A computer is a causal system that changes state in accord with a program. The states are syntactically specified by programmers, but they are states of a real causal system in the world. This is quite different from the abstract formal systems that logicians study. Dennett notes that no “computer program by itself” (Searle's language) — e.g. a program lying on a shelf — can cause anything, even simple addition, let alone mental states. The program must be running. Chalmers (1996) offers a parody in which it is reasoned that recipes are syntactic, syntax is not sufficient for crumbliness, cakes are crumbly, so implementation of a recipe is not sufficient for making a cake. Dennett (1987) sums up the issue: “Searle's view, then, comes to this: take a material object (any material object) that does not have the power of causing mental phenomena; you cannot turn it in to an object that does have the power of producing mental phenomena simply by programming it — reorganizing the conditional dependencies of transitions between its states.” Dennett's view is the opposite: programming “is precisely what could give something a mind". But that in fact it is "empirically unlikely that the right sorts of programs can be run on anything but organic, human brains” (325-6).

A further related complication is that it is not clear that computers perform syntactic operations in quite the same sense that a human does — it is not clear that a computer understands syntax or syntactic operations. A computer does not know that it is manipulating 1's and 0's. A computer does not recognize that its binary data strings have a certain form, and thus that certain rules may be applied to them, unlike the man inside the Chinese Room. Inside a computer, there is nothing that literally reads input data, or that "knows" what symbols are. Instead, there are millions of transistors that change states. A sequence of voltages causes operations to be performed. We may choose to interpret these voltages as binary numerals and the voltage changes as syntactic operations, but a computer does not interpret its operations as syntactic or any other way. Furthermore, any causal system is describable as performing syntactic operations — if we interpret a light square as logical "0" and a dark square as logical "1", then a kitchen toaster may be described as a device that rewrites logical "0"s as logical "1"s.

In the 1990s, Searle began to use considerations related to these to argue that computational views are not just false, but lack a clear sense. Computation, or syntax, is "observer-relative", not an intrinsic feature of reality - "...you can assign a computational interpretation to anything" (Searle 2002b, p. 17), even the molecules in the paint on the wall. Since nothing is intrinsically computational, one cannot have a scientific theory that reduces the mental, which is not observer-relative, to computation, which is. "Computation exists only relative to some agent or observer who imposes a computational interpretation on some phenomenon. This is an obvious point. I should have seen it ten years ago, but I did not." (Searle 2002b, p.17, originally published 1993).

Critics note that walls are not computers; unlike a wall, a computer goes through state-transitions that are counterfactually described by a program (Chalmers 1996, Block 2002, Haugeland 2002). In his 2002 paper, Block addresses the question of whether a wall is a computer (in reply to Searle's charge that anything that maps onto a formal system is a formal system, whereas minds are quite different). Block denies that whether or not something is a computer depends entirely on our interpretation. Block notes that Searle ignores the counterfactuals that must be true of an implementing system. Haugeland (2002) makes the similar point that an implementation will be a causal process that reliably carries out the operations — and they must be the right causal powers. Block concludes that Searle's arguments fail, but he concedes that they "do succeed in sharpening our understanding of the nature of intentionality and its relation to computation and representation" (78).

Rey (2002) also addresses Searle's recent arguments that syntax and symbols are observer-relative properties, not physical. But Searle infers this from the fact that they are not defined in physics; it does not follow that they are observer-relative. Rey argues that Searle also misunderstands what it is to realize a program. Rey endorses Chalmers' reply to Putnam: a realization is not just a structural mapping, but involves causation, supporting counterfactuals. “This point is missed so often, it bears repeating: the syntactically specifiable objects over which computations are defined can and standardly do possess a semantics; it's just that the semantics is not involved in the specification.” States of a person have their semantics in virtue of computational organization and their causal relations to the world. Rey concludes: Searle “simply does not consider the substantial resources of functionalism and Strong AI.” (222) A plausibly detailed story would defuse negative conclusions drawn from the superficial sketch of the system in the Chinese Room.

John Haugeland (2002) argues that there is a sense in which a processor must intrinsically understand the commands in the programs it runs: it executes them in accord with the specifications. “The only way that we can make sense of a computer as executing a program is by understanding its processor as responding to the program prescriptions as meaningful” (385). Thus operation symbols have meaning to a system. Haugeland goes on to draw a distinction between narrow and wide system. He argues that data can have semantics in the wide system that includes representations of external objects produced by transducers. In passing, Haugeland makes the unusual claim, argued for elsewhere, that genuine intelligence and semantics presuppose “the capacity for a kind of commitment in how one lives” which is non-propositional — that is, love. To Searle's claim that syntax is observer-relative, that the molecules in wall might be interpreted as implementing the Wordstar program because “there is some pattern in the molecule movements which is isomorphic with the formal structure of Wordstar” (Searle 1990b, p. 27), Haugeland counters that “the very idea of a complex syntactical token … presupposes specified processes of writing and reading….” The tokens must be systematically producible and retrievable. So no random isomorphism or pattern somewhere (e.g. on some wall) is going to count, and hence syntax is not observer-relative.

With regard to the question of whether one can get semantics from syntax, AI futurist (The Age of Spiritual Machines) Ray Kurzweil holds in a 2002 follow-up book that it is red herring to focus on traditional symbol-manipulating computers. Kurzweil agrees with Searle that existent computers do not understand language -as evidenced by the fact that they can't engage in convincing dialog. But that failure does not bear on the capacity of future computers based on different technology. Kurzweil claims that Searle fails to understand that future machines will use “chaotic emergent methods that are massively parallel”. This claim appears to be similar to that of connectionists, such as Andy Clark, and the position taken by the Churchlands in their 1990 Scientific American article.

Apart from Haugeland's claim that processors understand program instructions, Searle's critics can agree that computers no more understand syntax than they understand semantics, although, like all causal engines, a computer has syntactic descriptions. And while it is often useful to programmers to treat the machine as if it performed syntactic operations, it is not always so: sometimes the characters programmers use are just switches that make the machine do something, for example, make a given pixel on the computer screen turn red. Thus it is not clear that Searle is correct when he says a digital computer is just "a device which manipulates symbols". Computers are complex causal engines, and syntactic descriptions are useful in order to structure the causal interconnections in the machine. AI programmers face many tough problems, but one can hold that they do not have to get semantics from syntax. If they are to get semantics, they must get it from causality.

Two main approaches have developed that explain meaning in terms of causal connections. The internalist approaches, such as Schank's conceptual representation approach, and Conceptual Role Semantics, hold that a state of a physical system gets its semantics from causal connections to other states of the system. Thus a state of a computer might represent "kiwi" because it is connected to "bird" and "flightless" nodes, and perhaps also to images of prototypical kiwis. The state that represents the property of being "flightless" might get its content from a Negation-operator modifying a representation of "capable of airborne self-propulsion", and so forth, to form a vast connected conceptual network, a kind of mental dictionary.

Externalist approaches developed by Dennis Stampe, Fred Dretske, Jerry Fodor, Ruth Millikan, and others, hold that states of a physical system get their content through causal connections to the external reality they represent. Thus, roughly, a system with a KIWI concept is one that has a state it uses to represent the presence of kiwis in the external environment. This kiwi-representing state can be any state that is appropriately causally connected to the presence of kiwis. Depending on the system, the kiwi representing state could be a state of a brain, or of an electrical device such as a computer, or even of a hydraulic system. The internal representing state can then in turn play a causal role in the determining the behavior of the system. For example, Rey (1986) endorses an indicator semantics along the lines of the work of Dennis Stampe (1977) and Fodor's Psychosemantics. Semantics that emphasize causal connection with the world fit well with the Robot Reply. A computer in a robot body might have just the causal connections that could allow its inner syntactic states to have the semantic property of representing states of things in its environment.

Thus there are at least two families of theories (and marriages of the two, as in Block 1986) about how semantics might depend upon causal connections. Both of these attempt to provide accounts that are substance neutral: states of suitably organized causal systems can have content, no matter what the systems are made of. On these theories a computer could have states that have meaning. It is not necessary that the computer be aware of its own states and know that they have meaning, nor that any outsider appreciate the meaning of the states. On either of these accounts meaning depends upon the (possibly complex) causal connections; digital computers are systems designed to have states that have just such complex causal dependencies. It should be noted that Searle does not subscribe to these theories of semantics. Instead, Searle's discussions of linguistic meaning have often centered on the notion ofintentionality.

5.2 Intentionality

Intentionality is the property of being about something, having content. In the 19th Century, psychologist Franz Brentano re-introduced this term from Medieval philosophy and held that intentionality was the "mark of the mental". Beliefs and desires are intentional states: they have propositional content (one believes that p, one desires that p). Searle's views regarding intentionality are complex; of relevance here is that he makes a distinction between the original or intrinsic intentionality of genuine mental states, and the derived intentionality of language. A written or spoken sentence only has derivative intentionality insofar as it is interpreted by someone. It appears that on Searle's view, original intentionality can at least potentially be conscious. Searle then argues that the distinction between original and derived intentionality applies to computers. We can interpret the states of a computer as having content, but the states themselves do not have original intentionality.

In a section of her 1988 book, Computer Models of the Mind, Margaret Boden notes that intentionality is not well-understood — reason to not put too much weight on arguments that turn on intentionality. Furthermore, insofar as we understand the brain, we focus on informational functions, not unspecified causal powers of the brain: “…from the psychological point of view, it is not the biochemistry as such which matters but the information-bearing functions grounded in it.” (241) Responders to Searle have argued that he displays substance chauvinism, in holding that brains understand but systems made of silicon with comparable information processing capabilities cannot, even in principle. Papers on both sides of the issue appeared, such as J. Maloney's 1987 paper "The Right Stuff", defending Searle, and R. Sharvy's 1985 critique, "It Ain't the Meat, it's the Motion". AI proponents such as Kurzweil (1999, see also Richards 2002) have continued to hold that AI systems can potentially have such mental properties as understanding, intelligence, consciousness and intentionality, and will exceed human abilities in these areas.

Other critics of Searle's position take intentionality more seriously than Boden does, but deny his distinction between original and derived intentionality, taking two main tacks. Dennett (1987, e.g.) argues that all intentionality is derived. Attributions of intentionality — to animals, other people, even ourselves - are instrumental and allow us to predict behavior, but they are not descriptions of intrinsic properties. As we have seen, Dennett is concerned about the slow speed of things in the Chinese Room, but he argues that once a system is working up to speed, it has all that is needed for intelligence and derived intentionality — and derived intentionality is the only kind that there is, according to Dennett. A machine can be an intentional system because intentional explanations work in predicting the machine's behavior. Dennett also suggests that Searle conflates intentionality with awareness of intentionality. In his syntax-semantic arguments, “Searle has apparently confused a claim about the underivability of semantics from syntax with a claim about the underivability of the consciousness of semantics from syntax” (336).

Others have noted that Searle's discussion has shown a shift from issues of intentionality and understanding to issues of consciousness. Searle links intentionality to awareness of intentionality, in that intentional states are at least potentially conscious. In his 1996 book, The Conscious Mind, David Chalmers notes that although Searle originally directs his argument against machine intentionality, it is clear from later writings that the real issue is consciousness, which Searle holds is a necessary condition of intentionality. It is consciousness that is lacking in digital computers. Chalmers uses thought experiments to argue that it is implausible that one system has some basic mental property (such as having qualia) that another system lacks, if it is possible to imagine transforming one system into the other, either gradually (as replacing neurons one at a time by digital circuits), or all at once, switching back and forth between flesh and silicon.

A second strategy regarding the attribution of intentionality is taken by critics (e.g. Fodor) who in effect argue that intentionality is an intrinsic feature of states of physical systems that are causally connected with the world in the right way, independently of interpretation (see the preceding Syntax and Semantics section). Fodor's semantic externalism is influenced by Fred Dretske, but they come to different conclusions with regard to the semantics of states of computers. Over a period of years, Dretske has developed an historical account of meaning or mental content that would preclude attributing beliefs and understanding to most machines. But Dretske (1985) agrees with Searle that adding machines don't literally add; we do the adding, using the machines (recently Searle (2002) has been making the same point in terms of observer relative attributions of intentionality). Dretske emphasizes the crucial role of natural selection and learning in producing states that have genuine content. Human built systems will be, at best, like Swampmen (beings that result from a lightning strike in a swamp and by chance happen to be a molecule by molecule copy of some human being, say, you) — they appear to have intentionality or mental states, but do not, because such states require the right history. AI states will generally be counterfeits of real mental states; like counterfeit money, they may appear perfectly identical but lack the right pedigree. But Dretske's account of belief appears to make it distinct from conscious awareness of the belief or intentional state (if that is taken to require a higher order thought), and so would allow attribution of intentionality to systems that can learn.

Howard Gardiner endorses Zenon Pylyshyn's criticisms of Searle's view of the relation of brain and intentionality, as supposing that intentionality is somehow "secreted by the brain", and Pylyshyn's own counter-thought experiment in which one's neurons are replaced one by one with integrated circuit workalikes (see also Cole and Foelber (1984) and Chalmers (1996), for explorations of neuron replacement scenarios). Gardiner holds that Searle owes us a more precise account of intentionality than Searle has given so far, and until then it is an open question whether AI can produce it, or whether it is beyond its scope. Gardiner concludes with the possibility that the dispute between Searle and his critics is not scientific, but (quasi?) religious.

5.3 Mind and Body

Several critics have noted that there are metaphysical issues at stake in the original argument. The Systems Reply draws attention to the metaphysical problem of the relation of mind to body. It does this in holding that understanding is a property of the system as a whole, not the physical implementer. The Virtual Mind Reply holds that minds or persons — the entities that understand and are conscious — are more abstract than any physical system, and that there could be a many-to-one relation between minds and physical systems. Thus larger issues about personal identity and the relation of mind and body are in play in the debate between Searle and some of his critics.

Searle's view is that the problem the relation of mind and body "has a rather simple solution. Here it is: Conscious states are caused by lower level neurobiological processes in the brain and are themselves higher level features of the brain." (Searle 2002b, p.9 ) In his early discussion of the CR, Searle spoke of the causal powers of the brain. Thus his view appears to be that brain states cause consciousness and understanding, and "consciousness is just a feature of the brain" (ibid).

Consciousness and understanding are features of persons, so it appears that Searle accepts a metaphysics in which I, my conscious self, am identical with my brain — a form of mind-brain identity theory. This very concrete metaphysics is reflected in Searle's original presentation of the CR argument, in which Strong AI was described by him as the claim that "the appropriately programmed computer really is a mind" (Searle 1980). This is an identity claim, and has odd consequences. If A and B are identical, any properly of A is a property of B. Computers are physical objects. Some computers weigh 6 lbs and have stereo speakers. So the claim that Searle called Strong AI would entail that some minds weigh 6 lbs and have stereo speakers. However it seems to be clear that while humans may weigh 150 pounds; human minds do not do not weigh 150 pounds. This suggests that neither bodies nor machines can literally be minds. It appears that minds are more abstract than that, and at least one version of the claim that Searle calls Strong AI is metaphysically untenable on the face of it, apart from any thought-experiments.

Searle's CR argument was thus directed against the claim that a computer is a mind, that a suitably programmed digital computer understands language, or that its program does. Searle's thought experiment appeals to our strong intuition that someone who did exactly what the computer does would not thereby come to understand Chinese. As noted above, many critics have held that Searle is quite right on this point — no matter how you program a computer, the computer will not literally be a mind and the computer will not understand natural language. This however cannot show that something else understands — it cannot show that AI cannot produce understanding of natural language, for this is a different claim. It is not the claim that the computer understands language, or that the program or even the system does. It is the claim that AI creates understanding, with the thing doing the understanding unspecified. This understanding mind might not be identical with the computer, the program, nor the system consisting of computer and program. Hauser (2002) accuses Searle of Cartesian bias in his inference from “it seems to me quite obvious that I understand nothing” to the conclusion that I really understand nothing. Normally, if one understands English or Chinese, one knows that one does — but not necessarily. Searle lacks the normal introspective awareness of understanding — but this, while abnormal, is not conclusive. Cole (1984) makes similar points.

The alternative metaphysics that was developing in the two decades before Searle introduced the Chinese Room argument was functionalism (q.v.). Functionalism is an alternative to the identity theory that is implicit in much of Searle's discussion. Functionalists hold that a mental state is what a mental state does — the causal (or "functional") role that the state plays determines what state it is. A functionalist might hold that pain, for example, is a state that is typically caused by damage to the body, is located in a body-image, and is aversive. Functionalists distance themselves both from behaviorists and identity theorists. In contrast with the former, functionalists hold that the internal causal processes are important for the possession of mental states, not just the overt behavior of the system as a whole. Thus functionalists may reject the Turing Test. In contrast with identity theorists, functionalists hold that mental states might be had by a variety of physical systems (or non-physical, cf. Cole and Foelber 1984, in which a mind changes from a material to an immaterial implementation, neuron by neuron). Thus while an identity theorist will identify pain with certain neuron firings, a functionalist will identity pain with something more abstract, a functional role that might be had by many different types of underlying system. Functionalists accuse identity theorists of substance chauvinism. However, functionalism remains controversial: functionalism is vulnerable to the Chinese Nation type objections discussed above, and functionalists notoriously have trouble explaining qualia, a problem highlighted by the apparent possibility of an inverted spectrum, where qualitatively different states might have the same functional role (e.g. Block 1978, Maudlin 1989).

These controversial metaphysical issues bear on the central inference in the Chinese Room argument. From the intuition that in the CR thought experiment he would not understand Chinese by running a program, Searle infers that there is no understanding created by running a program. Clearly, whether that inference is valid or not turns on a metaphysical question about the identity of persons and minds. If the person understanding is not identical with the room operator, then the inference is unsound.

5.4 Simulation, duplication and evolution

In discussing the CR, Searle argues that there is an important distinction between simulation and duplication. No one would mistake a computer simulation of the weather for weather, or a computer simulation of digestion for real digestion. It is just as serous a mistake to confuse a computer simulation of understanding with understanding.

On the face of it, this seems true. But two problems emerge. It is not clear that we can always make the distinction between simulations and the real thing. Hearts are biological, if anything is. Are artificial hearts simulations of hearts? Or are they functional duplicates of hearts, hearts made from different materials? Walking is a biological phenomenon performed using limbs. Do those with artificial limbs walk? Or do they simulate walking? If the properties that are needed to be certain kind of thing are high-level properties, anything sharing those properties will be a thing of that kind, even if it differs in its lower level properties. Chalmers (1996) offers a principle governing when simulation is replication. Chalmers suggests that, contra Searle and Harnad (1989), a simulation of X can be an X, namely when the property of being an X is an organizational invariant, a property that depends only on the functional organization of the underlying system, and not on any other details.

Copeland (2002) argues that the Church-Turing thesis does not entail that the brain (or every machine) can be simulated by a universal Turing machine, for the brain (or other machine) might have primitive operations that are not simple clerical routines that can be carried out by hand. Turing's 1938 Princeton thesis described such machines (“O-machines”). If the brain is such a machine, then: “There is no possibility of Searle's Chinese Room Argument being successfully deployed against the functionalist hypothesis that the brain instantiates an O-machine….” (120). Copeland then turns to the Brain Simulator Reply. He argues that Searle correctly notes that one cannot infer from X simulates Y, and Y has property P, to the conclusion that therefore X has Y's property P for arbitrary P. But Copeland claims that Searle himself commits the simulation fallacy in extending the CR argument from traditional AI to apply against computationalism. The contrapositive of the inference is logically equivalent — X simulates Y, X does not have P therefore Y does not — where P is understands Chinese. The faulty step is: the CR operator S simulates a neural net N, it is not the case that S understands Chinese, therefore it is not the case that N understands Chinese. Copeland also notes results by Siegelmann and Sontag (1994) showing that some connectionist networks cannot be simulated by a universal Turing Machine (in particular, where connection weights are real numbers).

There is another problem with the simulation-duplication distinction, arising from the the process of evolution. Searle wishes to see the mental as properties only of certain biological systems, presumably the product of evolution, while computers merely simulate these properties. At the same time, in the Chinese Room scenario, Searle maintains that a system can exhibit behavior just as complex as human behavior, simulating any degree of intelligence and language comprehension that one can imagine, and simulating any ability to deal with the world, yet not understand a thing. He also says that such systems might be implemented with very ordinary materials, for example with tubes of water and valves.

This creates a biological problem, beyond the Other Minds problem that early critics of the CR argument noted. While we may presuppose that others have minds, evolution makes no such presuppositions. The selection forces that drive biological evolution select on the basis of behavior. Evolution can select for the ability to use information about the environment creatively and intelligently, as manifest in the behavior of the organism. If there is no overt difference in behavior in any set of circumstances between a system that understands and one that does not, evolution cannot select for genuine understanding. And so it seems that on Searle's account, minds that genuinely understand meaning have no advantage over less mysterious creatures that merely process information, using processes that we know exist on independent grounds. Thus a position that implies that simulations of understanding can be just as well-adapted as the real thing, leaves us with a puzzle about how and why systems with understanding could evolve.

Conclusion

Leibniz and Searle had similar intuitions about the systems they consider in their respective thought experiments, Leibniz’ Mill and the Chinese Room. In both cases they consider a complex system composed of relatively simple operations, and note that it is impossible to see how understanding or consciousness could result. These simple arguments do us the service of highlighting the serious problems we face in understanding meaning and minds. The many issues raised by the Chinese Room argument will not be settled until there is a consensus about the nature of meaning, its relation to syntax, and about the nature of consciousness. There continues to be significant disagreement about what processes create meaning, understanding, and consciousness, and what can be proven a priori by thought experiments.

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consciousness: and intentionality | emergent properties | epiphenomenalism | functionalism | information: biological | mental content: causal theories of | mental representation | multiple realizability | neuroscience, philosophy of | other minds | thought experiments | Turing, Alan | Turing test