Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Samuel Clarke

1. Collins mentions More, Turner, and Clarke among the supporters of the dimensional extension of God: A. Collins, A Discourse of Free Thinking (London, 1713), pp. 47-8.

2. P. Des Maizeaux, Recueil de diverses piéces…par Mrs. Leibniz, Clarke, Newton, & autre autheurs celébres (Amsterdam, 1720), tome 1, p. v. Koyrè and Cohen have shown that the Avertissement was written by Newton by publishing the several drafts by his own hand. However, as they themselves point out, there is no reason to doubt that Clarke contributed to it. See their “Newton & the Leibniz-Clarke Correspondence,” Archives Internationales d'Histoire des Sciences 15 (1962), 63-126, especially 95.

3. For an exhaustive treatment of the ins and outs of the controversy, see J. P. Ferguson, The Philosophy of Dr Samuel Clarke and its Critics (New York: Vantage Press, 1974, ch. V.