Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.12

Proposition 2.12.
Consider a population P and a proposition A such that (i) A is a reflexive common indicator in P that x and (ii) A is a reflexive common indicator in P that each member of P reasons faultlessy. Suppose A holds and each agent in P reasons faultlessly. Then there is common (actual) belief in P that x.

Proof. (Cubitt and Sugden 2003)

1. Ri A   (from RCI1 and the assumption that A holds)
2. A indi Rj A   (from RCI2)
3. i reasons faultlessly   (assumption)
4. A indi (j reasons faultlessly)   (from RCI3)
5. A indi x   (from RCI3)
6. Ri x   (from 1 and 5, using CS1)
7. Bi x   (from 3, 6, and the definition of "faultless reasoning")
8. Ri (A indi x)   (from 5, using RCI4)
9. A indi (Rj x)   (from 2 and 8, using CS5)
10. A indi (Ri x ∧ (j reasons faultlessly))   (from 4 and 9, using CS3)
11. (Rj x ∧ (j reasons faultlessly)) entails Bj x   (from definition of "faultless reasoning")
12. A indi Bj x   (from 1 and 11, using CS1)
13. Ri Bj x   (from 1 and 12, using CS1)
14. Bi Bj x   (from 3, 13, and the definition of "faultless reasoning")
15. Ri (A indj Bk x)   (from 12, using RCI4)
16. A indi (Rj Bk x)   (from 2 and 15, using C5)

And so on, for all i, j, k, etc. in P. Lines 7, 14, 7n (n > 2) establish the theorem.

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