Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

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Proof of Lemma 2.16

Lemma 2.16.
calligraphic-M(ω) is common knowledge for the agents of N at ω.

Proof.
Since calligraphic-M is a coarsening of calligraphic-Hi for each iN, Ki(calligraphic-M(ω)). Hence, K1N(calligraphic-M(ω) ), and since by definition Ki(calligraphic-M(ω)) = { ω | calligraphic-Hi(ω) ⊆ calligraphic-M(ω)} = calligraphic-M(ω),

K1N(calligraphic-M(ω)) =
iN
Ki(calligraphic-M(ω)) = calligraphic-M(ω)

Applying the recursive definition of mutual knowledge, for any m ≥ 1,

KmN(calligraphic-M(ω)) =
iN
Ki(Km−1N(calligraphic-M(ω)) =
iN
Ki(calligraphic-M(ω)) = calligraphic-M(ω)

so, since ω ∈ calligraphic-M(ω), by definition we have ω ∈ K*N(calligraphic-M(ω)). QED

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