Supplement to Common Knowledge
Proof of Proposition 2.17
Proposition 2.17 (Aumann 1976)Let be the meet of the agents' partitions i for each i ∈ N. A proposition E ⊆ Ω is common knowledge for the agents of N at ω iff (ω) ⊆ E. In Aumann (1976), E is defined to be common knowledge at ω iff (ω) ⊆ E.
Proof.
(⇐) By Lemma 2.16,
(
ω
) is common knowledge at ω, so E is common knowledge at
ω by Proposition 2.4.
(⇒) We must show that K*N(E) implies that (ω) ⊆ E. Suppose that there exists ω′ ∈ (ω) such that ω′ E. Since ω′ ∈ (ω), ω′ is reachable from ω, so there exists a sequence 0, 1, … , m−1 with associated states ω1, ω2, … , ωm and information sets ik(ωk) such that ω0 = ω, ωm = ω′, and ωk ∈ ik(ωk+1). But at information set ik(ωm), agent ik does not know event E. Working backwards on k, we see that event E cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent i1 cannot rule out the possibility that agent i2 thinks that … that agent im−1 thinks that agent im does not know E.
Copyright © 2005 by
Peter Vanderschraaf <peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu>
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@andrew.cmu.edu>
Peter Vanderschraaf <peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu>
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@andrew.cmu.edu>