Common Knowledge > Proof of Proposition 2.18 (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Winter 2006)

Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.18

Proposition 2.18.
Let C^*_N be the greatest fixed point of f_E. Then C^*_N(E) = K^*_N(E).

Proof.

We have shown that K^*_N(E) is a fixed point of f_E, so we only need to show that K^*_N(E) is the greatest fixed point. Let B be a fixed point of f_B. We want to show that B ⊆ K^k_N(E) for each value k≥1. We will proceed by induction on k. By hypothesis,

B = f_E(B) = K¹_N(E∩B) ⊆ K¹_N(E)

by monotonicity, so we have the k=1 case. Now suppose that for k=m, B ⊆ K^m_N(E). Then by monotonicity,

(i) K¹_N(B) ⊆ K¹_N K^m_N(E) = K^m+1_N(E)

We also have:

(ii) B = K¹_N(E∩B) ⊆ K¹_N(B)

by monotonicity, so combining (i) and (ii) we have:

B ⊆ K¹_N(B) ⊆ K^m+1_N(E)

completing the induction. QED

Return to Common Knowledge