Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.4

Proposition 2.4.
If ω ∈ K*N(E) and E ⊆ F, then ω ∈ K*N(F).

Proof.
If E ⊆ F, then as we observed earlier, Ki(E) ⊆ Ki(F), so

K1N(E) = ∩
i ∈ N 		Ki(E) = ∩
i ∈ N 		Ki(F) = K1N(F)

If we now set E′ = KnN(E) and F′ = KnN(F), then by the argument just given we have

Kn+1N(E) = K1N(E′) ⊆ K1N(F′) = Kn+1N(F)

so we have mth level mutual knowledge for every n ≥ 1.

Hence if ω ∈ ∞
∩
n=1 		KnN(E) then ω ∈ ∞
∩
n=1 		KnN(F). QED

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