Appendix: Lewis's Theory of Languages as Conventions

A language, for Lewis, is a function from sentences to meanings, and this function is what a theory of the language will describe. As such, ‘the language’ is an abstract object. For this abstract object to be realised by a community, he proposes, is for its members to adopt this function as a convention governing their thoughts and actions. To understand the proposal, we need to understand what Lewis means by ‘convention’, and to note how a language could be a convention in this general sense.

A convention is a practice that solves a co-ordination problem within a community. Though mutually beneficial, the solution that adopting the convention represents is arbitrary. For example, the practice in North America of driving on the right rather than on the left is a convention in this sense: it is a mutually beneficial practice, but at least one other solution to the problem of avoiding head-on collisions is available: driving on the left. For Lewis, actual (i.e., realized) languages are conventions in this sense, too. The existence of shared meanings within a community is clearly beneficial since people are able to learn one another's thoughts about the world, and co-ordinate their behaviour in various ways. But the meanings of sentences are also arbitrary, as is evident from the use within different communities of different sentences with the same meaning.

Still simplifying for brevity, a convention according to Lewis is a regularity R in action (e.g., driving on the left) or belief within a population P iff the following six conditions nearly always hold:

(1) Everyone conforms to R

(2) Everyone believes the others conform to R

(3) The belief in (2) gives each believer a (practical or epistemic) reason to conform to R

(4) General conformity is generally preferred to slightly-less-than-general conformity

(5) R is not the only regularity that could satisfy (3) and (4).

(6) (1) – (5) are known matters of mutual knowledge: they are known to everyone, and it is known that they are known to everyone, and so on.

(2) and (3) jointly predict that R perpetuates itself within the community (as in (1)), despite being (according to (5)) arbitrarily chosen. A convention is stable within a community because it is rational for each member of the community to abide by it.

How could a language (a function pairing sentences with meanings) be a convention in this detailed sense, i.e., a regularity satisfying conditions (1) to (6)? Lewis's answer is that we have every reason to conform to the regularity of being truthful and trusting in L. To be truthful in L is to utter a sentence only if one believes that what it means (in L) holds. To be trusting in L is to believe whatever is meant (in L) by the sentences one hears uttered. Being truthful and trusting in L is a convention in a linguistic community just in case:

(1) Everyone is truthful and trusting in L

(2) Everyone believes the others are truthful and trusting in L

(3) The belief in (2) gives each a reason to be truthful and trusting in L

(4) General conformity to truthfulness and trustfulness in L is generally preferred to slightly-less-than-general conformity

(5) L is not the only language that could satisfy (3) and (4).

(6) (1) – (5) are known matters of mutual knowledge: they are known to everyone, and it is known that they are known to everyone, and so on.

Lewis call the situation of a language's being realized in this way a ‘perfect case of normal language use’. That is, it is at best an idealization in need of refinement. Chomsky and Davidson can be thought of as suggesting, in their different ways, that the conception of a language and its realization offered here is fundamentally mistaken and not merely crude.