The Kochen-Specker Theorem > Proof of VC2 (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Winter 2006)

Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Proof of VC2

Let S_x, S_y, S_z be the usual angular momentum operators satisfying [S_x, S_y] = i S_z, and define S² := S_x² + S_y² + S_z². It can be shown that the eigenvalues of S² are s(s + 1) where s is an integer or half-integer.

Now let s=1. Then it follows (see e.g. Kochen and Specker 1967: 308, Redhead 1987: 37-38) that S_x², S_y², S_z² are all mutually commuting and that:

S_x² + S_y² + S_z² = 2I,

where I is the identity operator. Now, from KS2 (a) (Sum Rule):

v(S_x²) + v(S_y²) + v(S_z²) = 2v(I)

Now, assume an observable R such that v(R) not-equal

0 in state | psi

>. From this assumption and KS2 (b) (Product Rule):

v(R) = v(I R) = v(I) v(R)

v(I) = 1

Hence:

(VC2) v(S_x²) + v(S_y²) + v(S_z²) = 2

where v(S_i²) = 1 or 0, for i = x, y, z.

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