Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Derivation of STAT FUNC

The result is proved for a pure state and a non-degenerate discrete observable A with eigenvalues ai.

We first rewrite the statistical algorithm for projection operators:

(1) equation
For an arbitrary function f: R maps into R (where R is the set of real numbers) we define the function of an observable A as:
     equation
Moreover, we introduce the characteristic function chi-sub-a of a number a as:
     equation
As a result, we can rewrite a project operator P-vector-a as:
(2) equation
and thus the statistical algorithm as:
     equation
We also use a simple mathematical property of characteristic functions:
     equation
whence we can also write:
(3) equation
Then:
     equation
Hence:
     equation
Now since
     equation

     equation
which is STAT FUNC.

Return to The Kochen-Specker Theorem