Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Deontic Logic

Kripke-Style Semantics for SDL

We define the frames (structures) for modeling SDL as follows:

F is an Kripke-SDL (or KD) Frame: F = <W,A> such that: 1) W is a non-empty set
2) A is a subset of W × W
3) A is serial: ∀ijAij.

A model can be defined in the usual way, allowing us to then define truth at a world in a model for all sentences of SDL (and SDL+):

M is an Kripke-SDL Model: M = <F,V>, where F is an SDL Frame, <W,A>, and V is an assignment on F: V is a function from the propositional variables to various subsets of W (the “truth sets’ for the variables—the worlds where the variables are true for this assignment).

Let “M modelsi p” denote p's truth at a world, i, in a model, M.

Basic Truth-Conditions at a world, i, in a Model, M:
[PC]: (Standard Clauses for the operators of Propositional Logic.)
[OB]: M modelsi OBp: “∀j[if Aij then M modelsj p]

Derivative Truth-Conditions:
[PE]: M modelsi PEp: ∃j(Aij & M modelsj p)
[IM]: M modelsi IMp: ~∃j(Aij & M modelsj p)
[GR]: M modelsi GRp: ∃j(Aij & M modelsj ~p)
[OP]: M modelsi OPp: ∃j(Aij & M modelsj p) & ∃j(Aij & M modelsj ~p)

p is true in the model, M (M or p): p is true at every world in M.

p is valid (or p): p is true in every model.

Metatheorem: SDL is sound and complete for the class of all Kripke-SDL models.[1]

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