Notes to Mereology

1. Actually, the calculus of individuals had variables for classes; a class-free, purely nominalistic version of the system appeared later in Goodman (1951). On the link between mereology and nominalism, see Eberle 1970.

2. This choice of logic is not without consequences. Particularly when it comes to the mereological operators of sum, product, etc., a free logic would arguably provide a more adequate background (see Simons 1991). However, here we shall go along with the simplifications afforded by the assumption of a classic logical background (with descriptive terms treated à la Russell).

3. The labels and nomenclature follow Casati and Varzi 1999, ch.3, with which the present text has some overlap.

4. We shall assume a classical logical background, treating ‘ι’ as contextually defined à la Russell. Much of what follows, however, would also apply in case a free logic were used instead, with ‘ι’ assumed as part of the logical vocabulary proper.

5. Universalism is also known as ‘conjunctivism’ (Van Cleve 1986, Chisholm 1987) or ‘collectivism’ (Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 1999); other authors call (P.12) the principle of ‘unrestricted composition’ (Lewis 1986), or the ‘general sum principle’ (Simons 1987), or simply the ‘fusion principle’ (Heller 1990).