Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Experiment in Physics

Figure 8

Figure 8

Figure 8. Schematic diagram of the differential accelerometer used in Thieberger's experiment. A precisely balanced hollow copper sphere (a) floats in a copper-lined tank (b) filled with distilled water (c). The sphere can be viewed through windows (d) and (e) by means of a television camera (f). The multiple-pane window (e) is provided with a transparent x-y coordinate grid for position determination on top with a fine copper mesh (g) on the bottom. The sphere is illuminated for one second per hour by four lamps (h) provided with infrared filters (i). Constant temperature is maintained by mea ns of a thermostatically controlled copper shield (j) surrounded by a wooden box lined with Styrofoam insulation (m). The Mumetal shield (k) reduces possible effects du e to magnetic field gradients and four circular coils (l) are used for positioning the sphere through forces due to ac-produced eddy currents, and for dc tests. From Thieberger (1987).