Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Properties

1. Let I be an interpretation function with respect to a model, so that I(a) is the individual I assigns to the individual constant ‘a’, I(Fn) is the n-place relation that I assigns to n-place predicate Fn. Then for all n-place predicates ‘Fn’ and individuals constants ‘c1’, ..., ‘cn’, the sentence ‘Fnc1...c n’ is true in the interpretation just in case < I(c1), ..., I(cn)> ∈ ext(I(Fn)). We would relativize this clause to variable assignments in the usual way to define satisfaction conditions for atomic sentences.

2. More generally, if φ is a formula with free occurrences of exactly the variables v1, ..., vn, then ‘[λv1,..., vn φ]’ is an n-place complex predicate (normal quotation marks are used here as stand-ins for quasi-quotation). In more complicated applications we could allow φ to contain no free variables (in which case ‘[λ φ]’ denotes the proposition that-φ) or more free variables than are bound by the λ-operator (to allow expressions like ‘[λx Fxyz]’, which we could quantify into, as with ‘∃y([λx Fxyz])’.

3. A standard sort of comprehension schema holds that for each open formula φ, ∃Xnx1...∀ xn(Xnx 1...xn if and only if φ).