Notes to Scientific Explanation
1. In addition to Hempel, 1965 and Salmon, 1989, see also Cartwright, 1983, Earman, 1986, pp. 80-110, and van Fraassen, 1989.
2. As an illustration of this attitude, consider Hempel's discussion of “support for counterfactuals” as a criterion for distinguishing laws from accidental generalizations in his (1965). While Hempel agrees that support for counterfactuals is, as it were, diagnostic of the law/accident distinction, he also holds that counterfactuals “present notorious philosophical difficulties” (1965, p. 339) and because of this cannot be used to provide any independent purchase on the distinction between laws and accidentally true generalizations.
3. In addition to the requirement that laws must be exceptionless generalizations, these include the requirements that laws not contain terms referring to particular objects or places and the requirement that laws must contain only projectable predicates in the sense of Goodman, 1955.
4. For a similar assessment, see Salmon, 1989, p. 15.
5. For example, according to Salmon , 1984 all (why) explanations are causal and causal explanations require tracing causal processes and their intersections (See section 4). By contrast, Graham Nerlich, 1979 is in rough agreement with Salmon about what counts as a causal explanation, but holds that there is an important non-causal form of explanation which he calls geometrical explanation — for example, the explanation of the trajectories of free particles in gravitational field by reference to the affine structure of space-time. Salmon would presumably deny that such appeals to space-time structure are explanatory. Sober, 1983 offers another distinction between causal and non-causal forms of explanation: he contrasts explanations that trace the actual sequence of events leading up to some outcome which he thinks of as causal, with a non-causal form of explanation which he calls equilibrium explanation in which an outcome is explained by showing that a very large number of initial states of a system will evolve in such a way that the system ends up in the outcome state that we wish to explain, but in which no attempt is made to trace the actual sequence of events leading up to that outcome.
6. This argument rests on the assumption that once one has specified all of the information that is relevant to some account, and has not left out any relevant information, one has explained it. In other words, it is assumed that it is not possible for all of the information that is relevant to some M to be insufficient to explain it. Call this the Nothing More to Be Said (NMTBS) argument. Many other treatments of explanation (e.g., Railton, 1978) make a similar assumption. It is far from self-evident that this assumption is correct. Why isn't it possible that even given a specification of all nomic and causal information relevant to some explanandum, this falls short of what is required to explain it? Why can't there be explananda that are simply unexplainable? As a limiting possibility, imagine an explanandum event M, the occurrence of which is governed by no laws, which has no causes, and the frequency of occurrence of which varies in unpredictable ways across time and space. If there is nothing more to be said about M except that it sometimes occurs spontaneously, does it follow that this information explains why M occurs? The contrary intuition is that the occurrence of M is a paradigm case of something that we are unable to explain. If this correct, the NMTBS argument does not hold in general and this raises the question of why we should accept it in the particular case in which all relevant information specifies only the probability with which an outcome occurs. In other words, why accept the claim, common to both the IS and SR models, that statistical theories explain individual outcomes? This issue is discussed in more detail below.
7. Some writers hold that the deterministic interpretation of structural equations is optional; the error terms that figure in such equations may be interpreted as representing the net effect of the operation of genuinely indeterministic processes. It is also arguable that although conventional causal modeling techniques assume that the macrosopic causes of juvenile delinquency are deterministic, this does not rule out the possibility that there are underlying processes at some micro-level that are indeterministic. If these claims are correct, it follows that causal modeling techniques are agnostic about indeterminism. However, this is not enough to vindicate the application of the SR model to the sorts of examples covered by causal modeling techniques since the SR model requires indeterminism. Thanks to Elliott Sober for helpful comments on this issue.
8. At the risk of completely overwhelming readers patience for this topic, let me add that rejecting Hempel's and Salmon's views about the kinds of cases in which it is appropriate to talk about statistical explanation of individual outcomes and the structure of such explanations need not commit one to the position that we can never explain non-determined individual outcomes. Instead, what follows is that if such explanations of non-determined outcomes exist, they will be different in structure from the IS or SR models. In my view, the indeterministic contexts in which it is most natural to think in terms of the explanation of individual outcomes are those in which indeterministic causes are operative and such explanations seem to have a rather different structure from what is captured by either the IS or SR model. Consider the following illustration of the operation of an indeterministic cause based on Dretske and Snyder(1972 ). A radioactive source is introduced into a chamber for a fixed time period. If the source decays during this period, it will trigger a Geiger counter that will in turn release a poisonous gas, killing a cat. Suppose that in fact the source is introduced, a decay event occurs, and the cat dies. Here it seems natural to think of the introduction of the source as both a cause of and as contributing to the explanation of the cat's death, even though the connection between these two event is indeterministic. As a foil to both the IS and SR models, consider the following (very rough and schematic) proposal (cf. Woodward, forthcoming): A sufficient condition for the introduction S of the source to explain the death D of the cat is that the following three conditions are met. (i) S and D occur, (ii) If S had not occurred, D would not have occurred, (iii) the probability p of D if S were to occur is greater than zero on at least some other occasions on which S occurs, where the conditionals in (ii) and (iii) are interpreted as non-backtracking counterfactuals. Call this is the probabilistic causality (PC) model. (The formulation (i) — (iii) is intended to apply only to cases in which there is a single causal path from S to D and no pre-emptive or potential back-up causes are operative. ) The PC model is quite different from both the IS and SR models. In contrast to the IS model and in agreement with the SR model, according to the PC model, whether the value of p is high seems to make no difference to the goodness of the explanation furnished. Even if the probability of decay was very low, if the decay occurs and the gas is released, the introduction of the source will be what caused and explains the death of the cat. This reproduces our pre-analytic judgment about the example. But in contrast to the SR model, it does not follow from the PC model that if S occurs and — D occurs, then the occurrence of S explains -D. This does not follow since the result of substituting -D for D in (ii) is a counterfactual claim that is false.
9. See especially Cartwight, 1979 and Spirtes, Glymour and Scheines, 1993, 2000.
10. See, for example, Spirtes, Glymour and Scheines 1993, 2000, Pearl, 2000, Hausman and Woodward, 1999.
11. An example is provided in Salmon, 1984 and subsequently discussed in Spirtes, Glymour, and Scheines, 1993, 2000. A collision C between a cue ball and two other billiard balls sends the first into the right hand pocket (A) and the second into the left hand pocket (B). C is a common cause of A and B and A does not cause B or vice-versa. Nonetheless, because of the conservation of linear momentum, the information that A occurred provides information about whether B occurred, even given the occurrence of C. In other words, A is statistically relevant to B, given C, even though A does not cause B. Intuitively, the problem is that the property C is too coarse-grained. Since the system is presumably deterministic at a more fine-grained level of description in which we specify the exact positions and momenta M of the balls, conditioning on M would render A independent of (irrelevant to) B. But if we employ variables like C that are insufficiently fine grained, the connection between causation and statistical relevance assumed in both the Causal Markov condition and the SR model will fail.
12. There is evidence from developmental psychology (e.g., Leslie and Keeble, 1987) that even very young infants are sensitive to the difference between changes in the trajectories of moving balls that involve spatio-temporal contact between the balls and changes in trajectories that do not involve such contact. In adults the former changes are much more readily perceived (or judged) to involve causal interactions than the latter. One may conjecture that the psychological mechanisms at work in such judgments also underlie our preference for causal explanations that involve action by contact. But while spatio-temporal clues are a useful heuristic for picking out causal interactions in some cases, such as those involving collisions, they provide little guidance and indeed may be positively misleading in other cases, as we will see below. So while a preference for causal explanations that contain no spatio-temporal gaps may be very psychologically natural, it is dubious that it provides a useful basis for constructing a general theory of causal explanation.
13. Cases of causation by omission are cases in which, to put the matter intuitively, the non-occurrence of some event causes an outcome, as when a doctor's failure to provide medical help causes the death of his patient. In such cases, there is no transfer of energy or momentum from cause to effect and no natural candidate for a connecting process. Some writers (e.g. Dowe, 2000) conclude on these grounds that causation by omission is not real or literal causation, although it possesses some features that makes it similar to cases of real causation. If omissions can be causes or figure in causal explanations, this presents an obvious prima facie problem for causal process theories like Salmon's. Cases of causation by C of E by double prevention or disconnection are cases in which C prevents or interferes with the operation of a second factor D which if operative would block the occurrence of E. By removing the preventer D of E, C causes E to occur. Examples are common in biological contexts — see Schaffer, 2000, Woodward, 2002, and for more general discussion of this phenomenon, see Hall, forthcoming and Lewis, 2000. Again, if it is accepted that citing a disconnecting cause provides a (scientific) explanation, this is a difficulty for causal process theory at least as formulated by Salmon.
14. One might well wonder what the basis for this judgment is. Can't the gas as a whole be “marked” — e.g., by heating it — and won't the gas transmit this mark, at least for awhile?
15. The reader is reminded here of a point made in connection with the hidden structure strategy in: the lower level explanations that “underlie” upper level explanations will not always be “ideals” in terms of which the upper level explanations are to be judged.
16. Morrison, 2000 emphasizes the heterogeneity of unification and provides a number of examples illustrating the point that many sorts of unification seem to have little to do with explanation. Sober, 1999, forthcoming, argues that at least in many cases we prefer unified theories over less unified competitors because the former are better confirmed than the latter, and not because the former provide better explanations than the latter. In other words, unification is an epistemological virtue that is relevant to confirmation, but is not an explanatory virtue.
17. These remarks gloss over some complex issues. Some classificatory schemes use causal or etiological information as a basis for constructing classifications. It may be argued that such classificatory schemes are not merely descriptive but rather explanatory in virtue of “invoking” or “appealing to” causal information. It seems clear, however, that there are other classificatory schemes that are not guided by causal information but nonetheless achieve information compression. Such classifications do not provide causal explanations.
18. Sober, 1999 argues for the stronger but related thesis that there is “no objective reason ” (p.551) to prefer unified over disunified explanations — which we prefer will depend on our explanatory interests. He also notes that explanations that cite a great deal of micro-detail and which are regarded by philosophers like Kitcher as “less unified ” than explanations that abstract from such detail (and hence can apply to systems with different microstructures) need not be regarded as competitors — that is, we don't need to choose between them. A glance at any molecular biology textbook will show that Sober is correct in contending that scientists do not always prefer explanations that abtract away from micro-detail and that we should reject any theory of explanation that automatically requires such abstraction. It is of course a further question whether abstracting explanations should be regarded as “more unified” than explanations that provide micro-detail. In fact, the latter are typically more integrated with fundamental theories in physics and chemistry and in this respect arguably more unified.
19. A parallel problem applies to the suggestion that all explanation has a DN structure, unless some version of the hidden structure strategy can be made to work.
20. Whether one accepts this assessment will depend in part on whether one thinks that there are non-causal forms of why-explanation (in the broad and vague sense of why-explanation gestured at in Section 1). If there are, then a more adequate theory of causation will take us only part of the way toward a more satisfactory theory of explanation.
21. Relevant recent work includes Hall, forthcoming, Lewis, 1986, 2000, Pearl, 2000, and Spirtes, Glymour and Scheines, 1993, 2000.