Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Bertrand Russell

1. For discussion of paradoxes in addition to Russell's paradox, see Whitehead and Russell (1910), Introduction, Ch. 2, sec. 8, as well as the entry on paradoxes and contemporary logic.

2. For example, see Russell, Problems of Philosophy (1912a) where he states that propositions with the highest degree of self-evidence (what he here calls “intuitive knowledge”) include “those which merely state what is given in sense, and also certain abstract logical and arithmetical principles, and (though with less certainty) some ethical propositions” (p. 109).

3. This distinction is slightly complicated by the fact that, even though knowledge by description is in part based upon knowledge of truths, it is still knowledge of things, and not of truths. I am grateful to Russell Wahl for reminding me of this point.