The Philosophy of Dance

First published Mon Jan 12, 2015

Dance is practiced in many forms and for many reasons, including social, educative, political and therapeutic reasons. This article will consider the philosophy of dance as a Western theater or concert art, by which I mean the sort of art that is practiced in a performance space and that is offered for some sort of audience or spectator appreciation. Further, this entry will focus on the philosophy of dance that has developed as a subset of philosophical aesthetics, considering philosophical questions such as “what is the nature of a dance?” and “how are dance performances appreciated, experienced and perceived?”

Of course, seeking to answer traditional questions important to philosophical aesthetics is just one of many ways to approach dance in order to better understand what it is and why it matters to us. There are theories and insights offered by dance studies scholars, historians, educators, anthropologists, practitioners, dance critics and others, for example, that are relevant to the questions asked by philosophical aestheticians. Philosophy students and others who are interested in dance philosophy are strongly advised to consider sources from outside of the academy of philosophy and to conduct their own research in a way that makes use of the rich and enlightening work that comes from these other fields of inquiry. In addition the dance philosopher must take care to identify which methodology is being used to discuss which question and for what purposes. While analytic philosophers of aesthetics might want to know what the “work” of dance as art is, for example, this may not be a question of relevance to the continental, pragmatic or process philosopher (and even less relevant to the dance studies scholar). Similarly, accounts of dance that focus heavily on the lived experience of dance as art for both the performer and the audience that answers to the truth of that experience for dance practitioners may be of interest to pragmatists and phenomenological philosophers but may not be accepted as relevant by some analytic philosophers. (For an anthropological and semiotic approach to dance see Hanna 1987. For a phenomenological approach to dance see Albright 2011. For a phenomenological approach to dance, movement and thought that makes recourse to evolutionary biology see Sheets-Johnstone, 1981 and 1984. For a process philosophy approach to dance see Manning 2013. For more on the relation between philosophy and dance see Foster, Rothfield and Dunagan 2005, Sparshott 2004, and Van Camp 2009.)

1. The Status of the Field

Dance is underrepresented in philosophical aesthetics. This means that, as a whole, the philosophical aesthetics of dance lacks the full range of views that one can find in more developed field of aesthetics such as literature or music. One reason for this underrepresentation is identified by Francis Sparshott in “The Missing Art of Dance” (1983). Here Sparshott explains that dance was not originally construed as a fine art under the 18th-century system of the fine arts that culminated in G.W.F. Hegel’s philosophy (see Hegel 1835). Hegel’s idea was that the fine arts were those that realized the spirit of the people by bringing truth or the “idea” to light in material form (for more on Hegel’s aesthetics see Houlgate 2014). His system of the arts included only painting, sculpture, architecture, poetry, and music, prioritizing the first three for being able to symbolize and represent truth visually and the latter two for doing so aurally. Music only made it into the system as a kind of analog of poetry, so Hegel elevated the kind of music that had a sung and verbal aspect above “absolute” or instrumental music. The idea was that the “fine” arts are those that contribute to knowledge and intellectual thought, with the implication that supposedly non-symbolic and non-verbal arts like dance were pre-lingual and pre-civilization, belonging only to the world of primitive gesture or to the low and the corporeal rather than to the elevated and cultural (see Levin 1983). Thus Hegel can perhaps be credited with what seems to be one underlying idea in analytic aesthetics – that for something to be construed as “art” at all it needs to be understood intellectually rather than responded to in bodily ways. Related to this is the idea that works of art (including dances conceived of as artworks) are created by transforming something from ordinary life or experience into an artistic symbol that exists and that is to be appreciated and experienced at a remove from “ordinary” life. (For additional literature providing reasons for dance’s underrepresentation in aesthetics, see Carter 2005, Sparshott 1988 and Van Camp 1981.)

Opposed to Sparshott’s view of the history of dance philosophy is Julie Van Camp, a philosopher who agrees that dance is underrepresented in philosophical aesthetics but who denies that it is has been quite as underrepresented as Sparshott claims. Indeed, in her article “Philosophy of Dance (Essay-Review)”, Van Camp (1996a) asserts that Sparshott overlooks or neglects many important works of dance philosophy in his assessment of the field, both relying on ideas from others without attribution and in failing to fully research the sources that exist in fields of dance scholarship outside of the academy of philosophy that are philosophically relevant.

2. What Is Dance?

As a subset of philosophical aesthetics that is interested in the question, “what is the nature of dance as art?”, dance philosophy has faced some unique challenges and difficulties. First, dances usually lack words or texts and are often developed without the use of a written plan, script or score of any kind (see Franko 1989 and 2011a). In addition many dance scholars eschew the idea that dance can be reduced to or compared to anything like a score or text. Mark Franko, for example, points out that “contemporary thought on dance is frequently split between a concept of dance-as-writing and a concept of dance as beyond the grasp of all language, especially written language” (2011a, 322; see also Franko 2011b). (For more on the idea of dance as texts see Franko 1993.) Even when there is a score, this score is not always used as an essential recipe for the performances but can instead just serve as the inspiration for a performance that is completely different (see Franko 1989). In addition, standardized notation forms are controversial, and no one form is universally accepted (see Franko 2011a and Van Camp 1998). This makes it difficult to place dance into metaphysical categories designed with other forms of art in mind. Second, dance has salient bodily aspects that complicate the question of how and why it can be conceived as a fine art, and how mind and its connection with the body is involved in the making, performing, evaluating and appreciating of dances. (See Pakes 2006 for one account of the “mind-body” problem in dance.)

The dance philosopher is thus faced with these two tasks among others: 1) to show how dance is or is not properly conceived as a form of art that can be analyzed under the conceptual tools and resources developed for the traditional fine arts, 2) to discern in what precise ways traditional aesthetics might need to be changed or developed in order to accommodate dance. One traditional way that dance philosophers have considered the question “what is dance?” is to characterize dance as a particularly expressive form of art, or one that involves “action” in a particular way. (For more on expression as a feature of dance see Section 5.2 below.) Dance historian Selma Jean Cohen (1962) has held that expressiveness is present in all dance, causing Monroe C. Beardsley (1982) to posit that expressiveness might be a necessary if not sufficient condition for dance as art. Beardsley finds that expressiveness, which he characterizes as present when a movement has more “fairly intense volitional qualities” such as “zest, vigor, fluency, expansivenss, or stateliness” than necessary to fulfil any practical functions of movement as “workings, sayings and strivings”, is what changes other forms of movement (what he calls “motions”) into dance movements (what he calls “movings”) (1982, 31, 33 and 35). Borrowing from action theory, Beardsley says that one causal bodily action can, under the right circumstances, be sortally generated into another kind of action. Thus, the act of marrying can, under the right circumstances, also be bigamy. Following Beardsley here, we can thus say that an act of running, for example, can, under the right circumstances, also be dance. The right circumstances, he maintains, might be expressiveness, as described above. We can also infer here that other conditions of dance might also apply (being on a stage in a theater, being offered for appreciation as a dance, conducted in ways that are part of a dance vocabulary, etc.).

In making this claim, Beardsley rejects Haig Khatchadourian’s view (1978) that dance movements are not actions, crediting Van Camp’s Philosophical Problems of Dance Criticism (1981) for helping him to critique Khatchadourian in this way. (See Meskin 1999 for more on dances as action sequences rather than mere movements.) In short, Khatchadourian (1978) says that a dance consists of movements that are not actions because they are not intentional in the traditional sense, that of being directed towards making something change in the real world rather than in the imagined world of a theatrical performance. Dance movements, according to Khatchadourian, are instead, non-action voluntary activities that “consist in patterns of movement – either pure movement or movement representing certain imagined actions of imagined characters, imaginary situations, and so on – made by parts or the whole of the human body, creating dynamic visual, or visual and auditory, forms” (1978, 25).

Khatchadourian follows Susanne K. Langer (1953b) in his claim that dance movements are not actions. Khatchadourian says that his view differs from Langer’s in that she only considers the imagined form (the virtual form) to be the essence of dance, whereas he would say that dance can be comprised of pure, non-representational, movement as well. Neither Beardsley nor Khatchadourian agree with Langer: Langer (1953b) would presumably agree with Khatchadourian that dance movement is not action but agree with Beardsley that the kind of movement dance creates differs in kind from movement simpliciter.

Langer (1953b) explicitly includes dance as art into her system of the arts when she holds that all of the arts are in essence symbol-making endeavors. Dance is distinguished only because its symbol or “primary illusion” is one of virtual power or gesture rather than virtual time (the symbol for music), virtual space (the symbol for the plastic arts) or the illusion of life (the symbol for poetry when it is in words and in drama when it is presented in the mode of action). Nelson Goodman (1976) and Graham McFee (1992b and 2011b) have also found the intellectual “object” or dance work of art to be in its structure, but unlike Langer these philosophers do not find that this structure must amount to any particular kind of symbol. Instead the dance “work” consists in the arrangements of a dance’s artistically relevant features (whatever these may be) that can, at least in principle, be notated.

Anna Pakes’ theory is in line with that of Beardsley and Van Camp, against Khatchadourian and Langer. She (2013) agrees that action is a necessary feature of dance. Both Aaron Meskin (1999), and Pakes suggest that it is the embodiment of dance in a physical, intentional event that makes dances better construed as action-structures rather than eternal types. It is for this reason (among others) that they find dance to be ill-suited for analysis under a Platonic ontology of art in which the structure of the work of art is discovered rather than created. Sondra Horton Fraleigh (1996) can be placed on Pakes and Meskin’s side here, since she holds that dance is necessarily expressive and transitive action.

Noël Carroll and Sally Banes (1982) have famously criticized Beardsley’s theory of the importance of expression for the nature of the dance work of art. They deny that expressiveness, in the sense of either intensity or non-practicality, could be either a necessary or sufficient condition for dance. They cite dances like Yvonne Rainer’s Room Service (1963) as a counterexample, holding that if this dance (where the movements performed are indistinguishable from those of ordinary life) is expressive, this is due to the propositional content of the art-historical and cultural context of its production rather than to the sorts of qualities mentioned by Beardsley. Carroll and Banes also note, against Beardsley, that “Room Service is not a representation of a working; it is a working. But it is also a dance – partially because through its aesthetic context it transforms an ordinary working (the sort of thing whose kinetic intricacies usually go unnoticed or ignored) into an object for close scrutiny” (1982, 38). It thus seems that, despite their disagreement on the value of expressiveness for dance, Carroll and Banes might agree with Beardsley and against Khatchadorian that dance movement is never mere or pure movement but instead is “transformed” by the activity of art into a different “kind” of movement altogether. They are silent on whether or not this activity constitutes an “action.”

For more on the general question, “What is dance?”, see Carr 1987, Carroll 2003, Copeland and Cohen 1983, McFee 1998a and 2013a, Sparshott 1988, and Van Camp 1981.

2.1 Problem(s) of Identity

There are many problems of identity for dance. One is that the moment that a dance is composed does not “fix” the dance for all time in that form. Dances are usually known by the name and date of their first performance but subsequent performances and casts can change the structural and other qualitative features that were present in the original performance. Further, as mentioned earlier, many dances have no notated score and, if they are preserved via video or other method, subsequent performances can still deviate from these frameworks in significant and perhaps identity-changing ways. In addition, even where there is a score, it may not result in performances from that score that are experientially identifiable as the “same” work of art. A dance notation might also function as the jumping-off point from which to make a radically new kind of dance rather than a limitation on innovation and changes to which a dance choreographer or set of performers must adhere. There is also the issue that what a dance “is” in practice or for appreciation, in its “essential” features (if there are any), may not be identical with what a dance “is” for purposes of numerical identity and historical preservation. In this way dance is not unlike music (for more on this see Section 3, below, and S. Davies 1991).

Goodman (1976) has famously characterized dance as an “allographic” art, by which he means to distinguish it from what he calls “autographic” forms of art, like painting, where there is a stable and singular art object that is tied to a particular history of production. A defining feature of allographic artforms, according to Goodman, is that their works can, in identification-relevant form, be notated. This is true in principle, even in those cases where there is no actual score. Although Goodman acknowledges that “a score need not capture all the subtlety and complexity of a performance” he says that its function “is to specify the essential properties a performance must have to belong to the work…” (1976, 212). He also says that this can be done and that in fact it is done in a broad and benchmark sort of way in practice: “Prior to any notation, we make reasonably consistent judgments as to whether performances by different people are insances of the same dance” (1976, 213).

Adina Armelegos and Mary Sirridge (1978) have criticized Goodman’s view, and what they call the traditional model they suggest was constructed with other arts in mind, for focusing on sequences of movements as the primary constitutive features of dance works of art. They hold that features such as costuming, music, lighting, the contribution of individual performers and, most importantly, style are constitutive of dance works of art, even though these are features that would be considered “incidental” in music and theater when they fall outside of the score or script. A further problem they point out is that a dance score does not function the way a musical score or theater script typically does – it does not in practice always provide the essential features of a work or provide a recipe for subsequent performances to follow (see Franko 1989 and 2011a). (For more on the differences of dance with music and theater see Section 3, below. Whether or not Armelagos and Sirridge are right about musical scores and theater scripts here is something the reader is encouraged to consider.)

Thus, Armelagos and Sirridge hold that Goodman’s idea of the dance work of art as an abstract structure that can in principle be notated does not align with how notations are used in dance practice. (One might ask whether this is a relevant criticism if Goodman never sought to address dance practice. For a different account of how Goodman construes the work of art see S. Davies 2001, 102.) “In some cases”, they say, “a single [dance] score is used to produce several dance events which are not properly considered performances of the same work. In other cases, the dance events produced are properly considered performances of the same work, though the traditional notator would disallow them” (1978, 136). Armelagos and Sirridge thereby conclude that it is the dance performance, and not the actual score or any abstract notational structure in Goodman’s sense, that is the primary work of art for purposes of identity. (For a critique of what she calls Goodman’s “notational view” and of what she calls this “canonical performance” view, see Conroy 2013b. For more on dance notation in general see Guest 1985, 1989, 1998 and 2005).

McFee (2011b) provides a list of seven features that he says constitute a dance “work” of art (what he calls a “dancework”) for purposes of numerical identification, appreciation and historical preservation, although he is careful to clarify that these features do not amount to a definition of a dance work of art. On his view a dancework is (1) a performable and re-performable artwork with a particular history of production; (2) an abstract, structural “type” of which the performances are “tokens”; (3) a work created by a choreographer that has a historical identity, meaning, and continuity that is dependent at least to some extent upon what the choreographer intended; (4) a work whose performances are performed and interpreted by dancers; (5) an object with perceptible artistic properties; (6) an intentional object that exists in a broadly institutional context under a concept of art; and (7) a re-constructible and re-performable object. McFee’s (1), above, marks a break with Goodman, since Goodman says that it is autographic works like paintings, not allographic works like danceworks, that are identified by a particular history of production. (On this point against Goodman see also Levinson 1980 and Margolis 1981.) Both agree, however, that a work of art is a re-performable object tied to a constitutive abstract structure.

Van Camp (1980) opposes McFee’s points (3) and (4) to some extent, since she holds that, for purposes of artistic judgment and appreciation at least, it is the case that sometimes the dance performer “creates”, and not just performs and interprets, the dance. The dancer, for example, often supplies structural and stylistic elements of a dance during the course of rehearsing and performing the piece that were not specified or provided by the choreographer. If these contributions are significant then what the dancer provides might be better understood as “creation” rather than “interpretation”, she maintains. Chris Challis (1999), however, agrees with 4), above, holding that the dance performer represents the choreographer’s idea. (For additional criticisms of McFee’s view on this point see Bresnahan 2013. For more on McFee’s view of the dancer’s role see McFee 2013c. The reader is also encouraged to consider the “thin” vs. “thick” work of art distinction in S. Davies 1991 in light of whether creative additions to a “thin” work can “thicken” it or whether a different ontological framework for dance works of art is needed and, if so, why.)

Both Van Camp and Renee Conroy have argued that the ontology of dance needs to be more reflective of and responsive to actual danceworld and artworld practice. Van Camp has proposed “that the identity of works of art [including dance] be understood pragmatically as ways of talking and acting by the various communities of the art world” (2006, 42). She thus follows pragmatic methodology in its claim that it eschews essentialism, construed as a method of identifying fixed and unchanging features of a given concept, practice or entity. She also follows pragmatism in upholding pluralism, and in holding that the ongoing deliberative and decision-making practices of dance world constituents such as performers, choreographers, audiences, historians, and critics should be considered in an important way when developing an account of dance work identity. Van Camp also includes the art law community as part of this art world, suggesting that dance philosophers consider which features of a dance are given copyright protection in legal contexts. Conroy (2013b) has instead of a definition provided an argument for what she calls three “minimal desiderata” for an adequate account of dancework identity, two of which require that any theory be responsive to and applicable in danceworld practice, and one that requires that criteria of metaphysical adequacy be met. (For an additional account of why dance practice should be relevant when considering the ontology of art see D. Davies 2009.)

Goodman’s and McFee’s views on dancework identity both fall under what David Davies (2011b) calls the “classical paradigm”, which holds that an artwork like a dance is a performable structure that remains stable enough for at least numerical identification and preservation. The problem that Davies identifies is that dance-making and performing does not always stay within guidelines that would allow dance philosophers to say that this is true in all cases. There seem to be performances called Swan Lake or The Nutcracker that diverge so much, and in such innovative ways, from the original performances that it is difficult to pin identification of these works to any set of features (such as a certain sequence of steps, or the use of a given narrative) that would enable dance philosophers to say with certainty that these performances are “tokens” of the “type” that bears the ballet’s name (see Wollheim 1980 for more on the type/token distinction). This has led D. Davies (2011b) to note that in some cases it seems as if the “work” is actually a unique performance or production. If so, perhaps this means that some dances share more in common with the one-off “work performance” he identifies elsewhere in Philosophy in the Performing Arts (as in some improvised jazz performances) than with the classical paradigm. This diverges somewhat from Van Camp 1998, who holds that the history and practice of dance allows a wide degree of variation among performances of dance works without loss of work identity. It also diverges from Stephen Davies’ idea (2007) that there can be versions of performable works of art that differ from the original in features that are usually constitutive of that work but that are still instances of the work rather than a new work or an interpretation of a work. (For more on the difference between works, versions, and interpretations see S. Davies 2007.)

Research by Franko (1989) on dance reconstruction provides an additional argument against the classical paradigm, the idea that a dance is repeatable, which he says is a myth that is not supported by dance practice. First and foremost, he mentions that in practice dances are not created from scores the way they are in most cases in music since dance notation is not “a universally legible form of textual record” (Franko 2011a, 329). Even reconstruction of past dances from scores and recordings has been relatively rare among contemporary choreographers (Franko 1989). Franko points out that most choreographers who seek to reconstruct past dances do not so for the purposes of repeating or performing a past structure in order to preserve it. Instead they seek to comment upon, rethink or theorize about the earlier dance in something new. This may be true of music and of theater as well and it is something upon which the dance philosopher should reflect before assuming that this is a distinguishing feature of dance. (For more on comparisons with music and theater see Section 3 below; see also S. Davies 2001, 242–5, for a discussion of reconstructions of works of Shakespeare.)

Meskin (1999) has perhaps the most complicated and comprehensive ontology of dance of all, holding that when an audience experiences a dance performance we are experiencing three works of art: 1) a choreographic-work, 2) a production-work, and 3) a performance interpretation-work. All three are “types” that are tokened by particular performances, what he calls “concrete, spatially and temporally extended event-tokens” (1999, 46). He further notes that a solo performance by an individual dancer may also be its own artwork if that performance comprises the whole work. An individual dancer’s performance within a larger dance containing more than one performer, however, does not create a new artwork type for Meskin but, instead, just comprises part of the artwork. In short, by including productions and performances to the type-level of artworks Meskin provides one way to understand why the classical paradigm may be open to the objection that the dance work of art (understood only as one kind of type) is unstable. Differences in individual performance events, for example, may be due to differences in production- and performance interpretation-works that demonstrate or that create functional instabilities in the choreographic-work.

For more on the question of What is Dance?, including problems of dancework identity, see Carr 1997, Cohen 1982, McFee 1994b, McFee 1998a, Rubidge 2000, Sparshott 1988 and 1995, and Van Camp 1981.

3. Comparisons with Music and Theater

The art of dance is closest in form to music and theater, since in many salient instances it involves a performance setting in which performers and audience members share a physical and temporal space during the course of a live performance event. There are visual arts performances that share these features (to wit, Marina Abramović’s “The Artist is Present”) but for purposes of this section only a brief overview of the sparse dance philosophy literature in comparison with music and theater will be provided. (For an overview of the philosophy of music see Bicknell 2012, S. Davies 2003, Kania 2012, Gracyk and Kania 2014 and; for an overview of philosophy of theater see J. R. Hamilton 2013, Osipovich 2012 and Woodruff 2003. For performance in music and theater see D. Davies 2011b, Thom 1993 and Godlovitch 1998.) Unfortunately, there has been little work in philosophy of dance that addresses music and theater so the survey below will be somewhat speculative as to directions additional work in this area might take.

One of the difficulties for developing the philosophy of dance is that the methodology of philosophical analysis encourages separating out each art form in order to say what makes it distinct from every other form of art. Discussing hybrids such as dance-music or dance-theater artworks (which may also employ such visual arts features as costumes, makeup, sets and lighting) creates complications for the project of defining or characterizing dance as art in light of dance’s singular or unique features. (For more on hybrid artforms see Levinson 1984.) Thus that dance is most often performed to music, and that the music might in some cases be a constituting feature of the dance work of art, as in the case where a dance is created by a choreographer in conjunction with a composer, has so far eluded any sustained treatment by dance philosophers. Igor Stravinsky, for example, composed the music for ballets either at the behest of or in conjuction with a dance company director (such as with Sergei Diaghilev for The Rite of Spring and with George Balanchine for Apollo) and in these cases it might be argued that the music is a constitutive feature of the dance works of art that emerged from these collaborations (see S. Davies 2006, 95). S. Davies asserts that “ballet is a hybrid artform” that “unites dance, mime, drama, living sculpture, costuming, décor, and music” (1996, 95). Curtis Carter (2005) points to dance’s history of being thoroughly integrated with music and theater as one reason why it took so long for dance to be treated as a separate discipline by philosophical aesthetics. (For a few discussions of dance/music connections see Sparshott 1985 and 1988, 173, Carroll and Moore 2011 and Carroll 2013. For a history of dance as a theater art see Cohen 1992.) Music and theater may be discussed in terms of general similarities and differences, as I shall do below, but this is not the same as discussing a philosophy of art that considers dance-music or dance-theater works of art.

3.1 Similarities

One way that the philosophy of dance is similar to the philosophies of music and of theater is that in all three areas of inquiry there are debates about the location and nature of the work of art that is produced by these fields when they are practiced as art. Is the work of art an abstract structure (and if so what kind)? Does it/can it exist independently of performance? Is it constituted by performance? Can the work of art be characterized as a “type”? Is the author/creator separable from the performer in a clear way? What is the role and importance of the performer or performance in connection to work ontology? There are ongoing debates about the answers to these questions in the philosophy of music and the philosopher of theater, just as there are in the philosophy of dance.

Related to the question of the role of the performer is the question of what the performer’s use of her own body has to do with the resulting performance and also to the “work”, if there is one, of art. Here the closest analogue to dance in music is probably song, where the musician’s “instrument” is his own voice located in his own body, along with all the bodily components that support the voice such as systems for breath control. Theater usually involves the use of an actor’s voice and supporting bodily systems as well. In addition close analogues to dance in theater can be found in bodily enhanced comedy such as the kind of slapstick routines to be found in vaudeville and then popularized by such performers as Charlie Chaplin, Buster Keaton, Red Skelton and Lucille Ball, and all forms of mime. Dance is also used to a large degree in musical theater – a hybrid form of dance, music, and theater.

A third similarity between the philosophy of dance and the philosophies of music and of theater is that they are all dealing with an art form that is often experienced live in front of an audience. This leads to philosophical questions in each field about the extent to which dance, music and theater are: 1) communicative (“for” an audience), 2) experiential in a bodily way, 3) connected to a particular performative context, or 4) improvisational. (For more on dance improvisation see Section 6, below.)

Since dance, music and theater share the honor of being considered among the most expressive arts, perhaps because of the typical proximity of human performers to the way these artforms are experienced, the philosophies of these arts acknowledge this. All three also lend themselves to the philosophy of performance, including philosophies of identity and how features such as race, class, gender, sexual orientation, disability and other components of human identity are performed by a human performer who may have an identity in non-artistic life that differs from one they inhabit during the course of an artistic performance. Rhythm is a common feature of both dance and music and thus shows up in the philosophical literature on both. In addition, both dance and theater use physical gesture as a way of communicating with audiences, creating a point of connection for the philosophies of dance and theater. For dance, this is particularly true in the case of story ballets. Philosophical discussions of dance and theater are also likely to incorporate the importance of movement through space or spatiality. They may also refer to both dance and theater’s history in ecstatic Ancient Greek rituals that had mystical and religious elements as well (see Nietzsche 1872 and Jowitt 1998). (For more on dance and theater see Carroll 1992.) All three also manipulate temporality, the way that the performance unfolds through time, as part of the intentional experience of these arts in a way that is more pronounced and more variable than is the typical experience of appreciating a visual art like painting or sculpture. (For specific differences in temporality in the arts see Levinson and Alperson 1991.)

3.2 Differences

One overall difference between the philosophies of dance, music and theater has to do with the importance of notations and recordings. There is no general consensus on this in any of the three fields but in general Western art music and theater typically have compositions that are in a form that can be accessed by the performers and by the directors of the performance events. As mentioned in Section 2, above, not all dances have notated documents or videos that are used to provide a plan or recipe for performances. Even where notations and recordings exist, they are not always used in ways that are similar to how they are used in music and theater contexts. Dance performers, for example, are not usually sent home with anything tangible to study and practice. Instead, dancers typically learn a dance in a rehearsal studio with either a director or choreographer, or with one person functioning as both, in ways that communicate the dance both verbally and bodily.

Another difference is that dance performances are more often produced for live performance than for a recording. In the case of rock music and in jazz, for example, performances might be primarily for recorded music, with listening to the recording serving as a primary way for the appreciator to access the performance (see Gracyk 1997 and A. Hamilton 2003). And where there are some theatrical performances that are designed for film (think of Kenneth Branagh’s Hamlet, for example), this tends to be less true for dance, although there are cases where dances are made specifically for media such as film, for YouTube or for television shows. (For an article on dance in film see Brannigan 2014.) What this means is that dance aesthetics places a high premium on the live performance event setting, with whatever features attach to live performance (ephemerality, difficulties of preservation, visceral and kinaesthetic experiences, etc.).

Joseph Margolis locates the difference between dance, music and theater in the constraints of a common keyboard in the case of music and the constraints of a common language in the case of drama where no similar constraints exist in dance (1981). It is by no means clear, however, that dance does not sometimes have “dance vocabulary”, style and other constraints, even without the presence of a notated score or digital or video recording (see Sirridge and Armelagos 1977). Further, some contemporary music and theater philosophers have stressed the importance of performance as well, and this suggests that the constraints of the various arts may not be their most important features (see Gould and Keaton 2000, J. R. Hamilton 2007, Osipovich 2006, Saltz 2001 and Thom 1993.)

Yet another general difference has to do with the importance of the body and with all the ways that the body complicates the analysis of how philosophers are to understand the nature of dance. A musician may, except in the case of song, above, have an “instrument” that may be conceived as separable from his or her body to some extent, even though many musicians and music theorists hold the view that their instrument is an extension of their bodies in some important way, not unlike, perhaps, a dancer’s shoes (such as special dance character, tap or pointe shoes). Theater performers often use their bodies in performative and gestural ways, but, overall, one can say (with some exceptions of course) that the range of bodily movement and the focus upon this movement is less for theater than for dance.

The differences here boil down to what our artworld practices are for making, performing and appreciating dance, music and theater. Dance is often referred to as happening at the “locus” of the dancer’s body, for example, whereas music is often said to be located in sound (see Pakes 2013). McFee says the difference is that musicians “make or cause the sounds that instantiate the musical work” whereas “in typical cases dancers are the dance – their movements instantiate the artwork, rather than merely causing it” (2012, 2). As to the location of the work in terms of its meaning, one classical view is that the “soul” of a play exists in its “action” or plot (Aristotle c. 350 BCE). Another view is that one primary location of the meaning of theater is its linguistic meaning, whereas it cannot be said that most dance movements and gestures are linguistic in the sense of using a formal grammar and syntax (see McFee 2012).

4. Dance As Ephemeral Art

One of the features of dance as a performing art that has been often noted is that it moves and it changes, both during the course of any given performance and over time. A catchall phrase for this sort of impermanence – reflecting the lack of entirely stable art “objects” in every case – has been to say that “dance is an ephemeral art”, although there are alternative versions of what this means. (See Conroy 2012; see also Copeland and Cohen 1983 and Copeland 1993.) This does not mean that dance is insubstantial or unserious. Instead, what it means is that there is something vital about dance performances and events that disappears as it is being performed. As noted in Section 3, above, this may or may not distinguish dance from theater or music, although dance does seem to rely less on recordings and written notations in the making and performing of dances overall.

Dance critic Marcia Siegel famously wrote that dance “exists as a perpetual vanishing point”, which means for Siegel that dance exists in “an event that disappears in the very act of materializing.” (1972, 1). Siegel posits that dance has escaped the mass marketing of the industrial revolution “precisely because it doesn’t lend itself to any reproduction…” (1972, 5). Conroy (2012, 158) acknowledges that the “safest” ontological intepretation of Siegel’s claim would suggest that dance performances are one-time, transient events. If this is the case it would mean that there is no enduring “type” that constitutes a dance work of art that is “tokened” by various instancing performances. This would mean that the “classical paradigm” discussed by D. Davies (2011b) and upheld by Goodman (1976) and by McFee (2011b) is wrong. If we hold that some dance performances are transient but not others, then the classical paradigm would still need to account for those performances that do not fit, much like the ontology of music has had to deal with the ontology of highly or entirely improvised jazz performances that seem to be “one-offs” and that are not preserved via recording.

McFee (2011b) believes that the instability of dance works of art is a problem that is due to poor preservation and reconstruction of dances rather than a feature that tells us something meaningful about the nature of dance. He also thinks that dance notation might be developed in the future to provide a workable way to preserve and reconstruct dances, something that Van Camp and Franko suggest may not be possible (the specifics of their claims here can be found in Section 2 of this entry, above). We can take this to be the negative view of the ephemerality of dance.

A positive version of dance as an ephemeral art, however, is one that holds that we ought to appreciate, rather than decry, dance’s ever-changing and disappearing nature as something that makes a live performance of a dance that will not happen again the same way into a vital experience for both the dance performers and the audience. The positive account celebrates the live nature of the dance performance and helps to explain why kinesthetic responses to dance performances are both relevant and powerful. It also suggests that ephemerality is an aesthetic value for dance that gives dance the ability to provide a “you had to be there” sort of event. (See Bresnahan 2014 for an account of improvisational artistry in live dance performance as a sort of agency that is consistent with this positive view.) Conroy agrees with McFee that the phrase “dance is an ephemeral art” does apply to the difficulty of preserving dances, but she also thinks it should be conceived as a statement of a danceworld value; as a way of conveying “a communal attitude of tolerance for change with respect to choreography that has been previously performed” (2012, 160).

5. Representation and Expression in Dance

5.1 Representation

When considering the philosophy of dance in light of Western aesthetics, one of the concepts that arises is that of the traditional concept of “representation.” The term “representation” in its strictest sense is used to mean mimesis (Greek), following Plato and Aristotle, which is usually translated into English as “imitation” (see Plato c. 380 BCE and Aristotle c. 350 BCE). (For more on mimesis in philosophical aesthetics see Wolterstorff 1995; for more on dance as an art of imitation see Cohen 1953.)

Over the course of the history of philosophical aesthetics, the notion of what it means for an artwork to “represent” something, either in whole on in part, has broadened. (Indeed a “work” of art is a contemporary concept.) In applying the concept of representation to dance, Carroll and Banes (1999) identify four types of representation in which one thing can “represent” something else: 1) unconditional representation (here cultural codes enable the audience to recognize the referent); 2) lexical representation (such as the use of gestures to stand for certain ideas); 3) conditional specific representation (where some particular background knowledge is needed to understand it as a representation); and 4) conditional specific representation (where the spectator is simply informed that x is supposed to stand for y and they therefore see it that way).

The most common form of representation in dance is in the story ballet where a dancer represents a character and the ballet as a whole represents a story from a folk- or fairytale. As examples of 1) and 2), above, the dancer can represent through cultural codes (wearing her hair in pigtails when playing a little girl) and through gesture (holding a hand to her heart to signify love). (For more on the traditional use of gesture in dance see Cohen 1992.) As an example of 3), an audience member might need to know that Martha Graham’s Medea is based on the Ancient Greek story in order to fully understand all of the references in that dance. As an example of 4), an audience might be told that the title of a piece is “White Flower” by which he or she understands that the solo dancer in white should be considered as a comment upon some feature of a white flower.

To say that dance can involve representation or be representative overall is not the same as saying that the essential nature of dance is or should be to represent. In the course of dance history, however, some dance theorists have made this stronger claim, particularly in the 17th and 18th centuries. (See Carroll and Banes 1999, Cohen 1992, 42 and Franko 1989; see also Wolterstorff 1995 on the Romantic view of representation in art). By the early 20th century, the idea that dance should imitate nature also included the idea that it should imitate human nature, including the emotions (see Cohen 1992). Dancer and choreographer Ruth St. Denis also held the idea that dance should represent “the most noble thoughts of man” (Cohen 1992, 120). Today there is a general consensus among dance theorists that dance can but that it need not represent in any imitative way, although there are some dance theorists who still hold that dance must be communicative and that, therefore, there is no purely nonrepresentational dance.

Although philosophical aesthetics has moved away from the idea that art must or should be imitative, the idea that art exists in a symbolic world apart from the “real” world lingers (see Langer 1953b, Goodman 1976 and 1978, Danto 1981 and Walton 1990). Langer (1953a) uses the term “presentational” to acknowledge that dancers do something real in the real world (dancers are, after all, human beings who are moving their bodies), but holds that the art in dance is, in essence, a virtual presentation of powers – it cannot be a “real” presentation because art is in essence symbolic, presenting a symbol for feeling rather than exhibiting actual feeling.

For more on dance and the concept of representation see Bannerman 2013, Carroll and Banes 1999, Carter 2005, Cohen 1953, and Sparshott 1988, 1995 and 1998.

5.2 Expression

Dance philosophy has handled the concept of expression in a number of different ways. Expression in dance can be organized into four general categories: 1) subjectivist theories that specifically connect expression in dance to the felt emotion of a human being who has made or who is performing the dance, 2) “naturalist” theories that connect a way of moving to a particular person’s nature or body, 3) expressionist theories that say that what makes a dance expressive is its content, and 4) semiotic theories that say that it is the formal structure of a dance that makes it expressive. Whether or not the expression need communicate with an audience to count as expression is under debate. (For Beardsley’s concept of expression in dance and the reactions to it see Section 2, above.)

Dancers and theorists who find the source of expression in dance to lie in the dance performer include Isadora Duncan and Martha Graham (see Cohen 1992 and Daly 1994). Those who find the source of expression in dance to lie in the choreographer include Challis and Antony Tudor (see Challis 1999 and Cohen 1992). Fraleigh, following Michel Fokine, finds the source of expression in dance to lie in the human body (see 1996, 71). Tudor has insisted that dance expresses feelings through movement and not through any personal feelings or facial expressions (see Cohen 1992, 178.) Dance theories that focus on the content of the expression have included the claim that dance does or can express such things as non-personal emotion(s) and feeling(s), artistic ideas or purposes, socio-cultural identity and/or qualities associated with or conveyed by music. (See Carr 1987, Briginshaw 2009, and Ailey 1997 for discussions of dance based on its expressive content.)

What I have called semiotic theories of expression in dance usually focus on artistic dance expression as a form of communication that functions in a way that is similar to language, through “utterance” or through actions, signs, symbols and/or gestures that are “purposeful” or intentional in some way. Goodman (1976), Langer (1953a) and Margolis (1999) all have semiotic theories of expression in dance, in which dance is seen as having certain symbolic properties that do not amount to a language, per se, but that have communicative power. Langer believes that dance is expressive of virtual power through what she calls the “primary illusion” of gesture. Goodman thinks that dance expresses through metaphorical exemplification. Margolis (1981, 1999, 2001 and 2010) holds that dance is not a language, since it has no grammar or syntax, but that it is language-like or lingual since it is an expression (what he calls an “utterance”) of a human person or self with culturally embedded and art-relevant properties that can be perceived and understood as such by others. Sirridge and Armelagos (1977) follow Goodman’s semiotic theory of expression in dance in holding that a dance is expressive when it contains aesthetic properties that are exemplified through the metaphor provided by a dance’s abstract structure.

Margolis holds that “expressivity” in dance, understood as a certain aesthetic property, is found in the human body. He says that the dancer’s body has a “natural expressiveness” that is not reducible to any metaphoric structure that could in principle be codified in a notated score, thereby disagreeing with Goodman’s theory of dance overall (see Margolis 1981). Sirridge and Armelagos (1977) locate the dancer’s contribution to the expressivity of the dance metaphor not in the body’s natural expressiveness but in the dancer’s use of style. Here they define “style” as something composed of a dancer’s “spatial vocabulary”, which can be conceived as the “inventory of movements or sequences of movements” necessary to instantiate the dance metaphor that will exemplify its expressive properties (1977, 18). (For an additional discussion of this debate, see Beauquel 2013. For an additional theory on symbolic and semiotic dance communication through gesture, see Noland 2009.)

For more on the concept of expression in dance, see also Best 1974, 1978 and 1999, Elswit 2014, Fraleigh 1996, Jowitt 1998, Sparshott 1988 and Carter 2005. For an account of why communication is not necessary in dance see Fraleigh’s description of Merce Cunningham and John Cage (1996). See also Cunningham and Leschaeve 1999. For more on post-modern dance and its relation to expression in dance see Banes 1998 and Carroll 1981.

6. Dance Improvisation

Three types of improvisation in theater dance have been identified by Carter (2000, 182): 1) embellishments where set choreography persists, 2) improvisation as spontaneous free movement for use in set choreography and 3) improvisation for its own sake brought to a high level of performance. An example of 1) would be the situation in which a dance performer is allowed to amplify existing movements (doing a triple pirouette in place of a double, for example), or a stylistic flourish such as an extra flick of the wrist or tilt of the head. An example of 2) would be the case in which no choreography has been provided for eight bars of music and the dancer(s) is given the freedom to insert whatever he or she wishes in the open space. Finally, 3) would cover the situation that D. Davies (2011b) might call a “work performance”, where a work is choreographed by the dancers while dancing. It would also include the situation where either the whole performance or a substantial part of it is improvised from start to finish. Dances comprised of Steve Paxton’s “contact improvisation”, for example, would count as improvisation for its own sake (see Paxton 1975 and 1981).

Danielle Goldman (2010) provides a critical analysis of the idea of improvisational “freedom”, as represented in Carter’s improvisation type 2, above. She suggests that we examine social and historical constraints on the possibility of “freedom”, since such freedom cannot exist in oppressive conditions such as slavery where prohibitive social as well as physical barriers exist. Goldman thus suggests an alternative form of improvisation, one that is “a rigorous mode of making oneself ready for a range of potential situations…an incessant preparation, grounded in the present while open to the next moment’s possible actions and constraints” (2010, 142).

In “Taken by Surprise: Improvisation in Dance and Mind”, Susan Leigh Foster (2003) shares Goldman’s view that it is the moment right before an actual dance movement within a performance that matters to the special aesthetic experience of dance improvisation. She says, “it is this suspense-filled plenitude of the not-quite-known that gives live performance its special brilliance” (2003, 4). Her essay also contains a phenomenological account of the agency involved in improvisation, equating the lived experience of improvisation with a “middle voice”, in which a dancer finds herself in a flow of movement that takes the middle position between deliberative choices and passive direction.

Dance philosophers have also identified other forms of dance improvisation that do not fit within Carter’s three categories. Kent de Spain (2003), for example, brings our attention to a type of dance improvisation that is practiced by dancers in order to achieve a movement-based somatic state, what I will call “somatic improvisation”. Somatic improvisation, or the results of these improvisational exercises, may be included in a theater performance for an audience but need not be. Constance Valis Hill (2003) includes “challenge dance” performances, stemming from the African-American tradition of dance “battles”, where the purpose is to win an ever-escalating competition of skill and style. Like somatic improvisation, challenge dance improvisation can be offered for audience appreciation in a concert context but need not be – it has taken place in social and street settings, for entertainment as well as for “artistic” purposes. Finally, I (Bresnahan 2014) have made the claim that all live dance performance involves improvisational artistry to at least some extent and that this can be seen as a kind of embodied and extended agency under embodied and extended mind theories, in particular that of Andy Clark in his book, Supersizing the Mind: Embodiment, Action, and Cognitive Extension (New York: Oxford University Press, 2011).

For more on improvisation in dance, see Albright and Gere 2003, Clemente 1990, De Spain 1993 and 2014, Kloppenberg 2010, Matheson 2005, Novack 1990 and 2010, Paxton 1975 and 1981, and Zaporah 2003. For more on improvisation in the arts, see the Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism special issue on Improvisation in the Arts, Spring, 2000, Alperson 1984, 1998 and 2010, Brown 1996, Hagberg 1998, Lewis 2014, the Oxford Handbook of Critical Improvisation Studies, and Sawyer 2000. See also the Symposium on Musical Improvisation in Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism, Summer, 2010.

7. Dance Appreciation

7.1 Audience Appreciation, Experience and Perception

In dance philosophy there is controversy about how to construe the felt, bodily responses that the audience can and often does have while watching a dance performance. The use of the body in dance is one of the things that distinguishes it from other art forms, but to what extent does this difference make a difference in understanding dance as a form of art? In a broad sense, these felt, bodily responses are often called “kinesthetic” and the mechanism by which these responses occur is one of the things that is being debated. Two of the questions that arise here are the following: 1) What is the causal process by which kinesthetic responses are felt? and 2) To what extent, if any, does an understanding of this causal process inform a proper understanding of dance qua dance as art?

To take the first question first: Causal processes that can explain kinesthetic responses in dance are by no means well understood. It is not clear, for example, how “empathy”, understood in the broad sense as the ability to feel something based on what we perceive as someone else’s experience, like a dance performer’s, informs our kinesthetic and other appreciative responses. Here some philosophers, such as Maxine Sheets-Johnstone (1980), refer to philosophical accounts of our bodily connections to the world such as those found in Maurice Merleau-Ponty’s Eye and Mind and The Phenomenology of Perception (see Merleau-Ponty 1945 and 1964). In addition, Sheets-Johnstone (1999) bolsters this account with research in evolutionary biology. Mark Johnson (2007, see also Lakoff and Johnson 1999) and Richard Shusterman use the account of art (including dance) as experience that is found in the pragmatic tradition, particularly that stemming from John Dewey. Shusterman has developed his own pragmatic theory, which he calls “somaesthetics”, in order to explain an embodied engagement with art, including dance, that includes a sort of kinesthetic awareness of interior, somatic processes. (See Shusterman 2008, 2009, 2011a, 2011b, 2011c and 2012.) For more on empathy and the kinaesthetic aspect of performance see Foster 2008 and 2011.

In addition, there are contemporary philosophers of dance who use research in cognitive science and in neuroscience in order to ascertain the answers to why audience members report feeling kinesthetic responses such as a quickening heart rate and certain tensions along with more mysterious feelings in their muscles and nervous systems. Barbara Montero is one of the dance philosophers at the vanguard of research in dance-philosophy-related cognitive science. She has published articles (2006a, 2006b, 2012 and 2013) on how proprioception (the capacity that lets a person know their bodily position in space) might be construed as an aesthetic sense, how mirror neurons might be part of an audience experience of this sense, and how trained dancers might make better aesthetic judges at least in part due to some of these mechanisms. Carroll is one philosopher who has followed Montero’s research (see Carroll and Moore 2011) in his thinking about how dance and music might work together to affect our kinesthetic responses. He has also considered (see Carroll and Seeley 2013) how Montero’s research and other research in neuroscience might bolster dance critic John Martin’s theory of “metakinetic transfer” from dance performers to audience dances. (For more on Martin’s theory of “metakinetic transfer”, which he says is due to “muscular sympathy” and “inner mimicry” see Martin 1939 and Franko 1996. For another neuroscientific approach to audience engagement with dance see Seeley 2013).

The philosophers supporting the application of causal research in kinesthetic responses to dance in general hold that it is relevant to our proper understanding of dance qua the art of dance. Carroll and Seeley (2013) argue, for example, that one of the central features of understanding dance is to understand the nature of the experience of dance in all its aspects, cognitive as well as kinesthetic and felt. Thus connecting this experience with causal explanations is elucidating and appropriate to a full and broad understanding of that experience in all of its aspects. I will call this the “moderately optimistic view”, following D. Davies 2013.

Conroy has another kind of “moderately optimistic view” of how causal accounts of kinesthetic response can inform dance appreciation. While she finds that research from the sciences on kinesthetic responses is not irrelevant, Conroy believes that Montero’s use of neuroscientific research “lends only feeble support” (2013a, 204) to the claim that trained dancers are better equipped than non-dancers to appreciate dance due to kinesthetic responses that have been well-developed through dance practice. Conroy agrees that Montero’s evidence shows that trained dancers might be able “to identify subtle discrepancies between multiple performances of canonical movement types” but denies that this necessarily translates into better appreciation of dance qua dance as art, where what matters is appreciation of aesthetic properties which may or may not depend on the kind of perception Montero’s evidence identifies in every case (2013a, 205). What matters for Conroy for dance appreciation, then, is the ability to appreciate the aesthetic properties, which are (presumably) what mark intentional physical activities as dance rather than as some other sort of movement that need not be appreciated in aesthetic ways particular to dance.

McFee (2011a and 2013b) denies that causal explanations about kinesthetic responses are ever relevant to dance appreciation. I will call this (following D. Davies 2013) “the extremely pessimistic view”. McFee holds that causal accounts, particularly from the sciences, of the appreciation and experience of dance, either in terms of kinesthetic responses or anything else, are never relevant to understanding dance as art. He says that the idea that “our bodily reactions – our toe-tapping, sitting up straight, holding our breaths, tensing our legs, and so on” is relevant to dance appreciation “makes no sense” (2013b, 189). His thought here is that dance appreciation happens at the level of a person who appreciates, someone with the cultural resources to understand dance as a form of art, not at the level of neurobiology. Montero, Carroll and Seeley would probably agree that kinesthetic responses cannot alone provide an appreciation of dance as art. The difference is that, unlike McFee, they think that something important about dance and what we indeed appreciate about it is connected to how we do, indeed, respond to it, in bodily as well as in cognitive ways. For McFee (2013b), by contrast, audience kinesthetic responses inform nothing and instead are just behavioral evidence of an appreciation that is not, in essence, bodily. (For more on McFee’s view here see McFee 2003.)

D. Davies’ answer to the question of how scientific research can be used in understanding and appreciating dance is what he calls the “moderately pessimistic” view (2013). He agrees with McFee that there are some questions relevant to philosophical aesthetics, and to the philosophy of dance understood as a part of aesthetics, that cannot be answered by empirical research, no matter how accurate that research may be for answering certain scientific, causal questions. There are normative questions, for example, such as “what counts as proper appreciation of a work of art?” that science cannot answer. Empirical research, where used by dance and other philosophers, must, according to Davies, be applied carefully to the relevant questions (see 2011a and 2013; see also 2014).

D. Davies (2013) is only moderately pessimistic about empirical research, however, rather than extremely pessimistic, because he thinks that philosophy ought not to partition itself away from science and away from other disciplines that might inform our thinking. Here he suggests that we ought to follow the Quinean idea that philosophy ought to respond to and at least be cognizant of current science so that we know how our philosophic views fit into our web of other beliefs about the world. Davies (2013) is also sympathetic with the part of Seeley’s view (in Seeley 2011) that holds that empirical research can at least help us to avoid false assumptions pertaining to the arts that are tacitly or explicitly based on empirical misunderstandings.

For more on audience appreciation, perception and experience in general ways, ways pertaining to dance and ways that incorporate research from the sciences, see Freisen 1975, Gallese 2001, Goldman 2006, Hanna 1983, Martin 1933b, Reason and Reynolds 2001, Sklar 2008, Smyth 1984, and Sparshott 1988.

7.2 Dance Criticism

The philosophy of dance criticism is connected closely to the question of what is to be evaluated when one critically evaluates a dance. Should it be the “work” of art, however that is to be understood? Should it be the experience of the dance, whether “work” or no? Should it include an awareness and understanding of the performer’s contribution to what it is the audience perceives and appreciates? As in the sections above, philosophy of dance must decide to what extent to follow the concepts of criticism developed for the other arts by Western philosophical aesthetics.

The traditional model of dance criticism, understood as Western aesthetics criticism, can be found in McFee (1998b). Here, dance “works” of art (see earlier section on What Is Dance? for more on this) are treated as meaning-bearers, containing properties that a critic can point to in order to focus an appreciator’s attention on the art-relevant features of the work (1998b). McFee points out that dance criticism can be formal or informal, but that criticism properly understood must lead to an interpretation of a particular dance work of art that can be understood in some demonstrable sense in terms of its history, context and in terms of its relevant techniques. Hence, not all interpretations of a dance work of art are valid (see McFee 1992a, 1994b and 2011b).

Support for the value of criticism for philosophical aesthetics, including dance, can be found in the discussion of dance as an ephemeral art (see section of this article above), since that view of dance philosophers has been inspired, at least in part, by a reflection offered by the dance critic Siegel (see Conroy 2012). It also finds support in the work of Beardsley (1970 and 1981) and Van Camp (1980, 1981 and 1996a). Beardsley (1981), for example, holds the view that aesthetics depends on criticism and that criticism depends on aesthetics.

Van Camp goes so far as to say that “criticism is a vital part of the cultural context within which dance is created, performed, and appreciated” (1996a, 349). She (1980) also holds that dance criticism can help the dance philosopher to distinguish the creative from interpretive aspects of a dance performance and to describe and identify other features of evaluation and appreciation that are not always perceivable in performance, such as certain historical or production factors. Finally, Van Camp (1980) agrees with McFee that dance criticism can assist the dance philosopher to distinguish art-essential from non-art-essential features of performance, thereby assisting the dance philosopher to make ontological claims pertaining to the nature and identity of the dance work of art.

Sparshott (1995) disagrees with the idea that dance criticism is valuable for understanding dance and he appears to be the sole dance philosopher who holds this view. In short, his claim is that, because dance criticism is based on dance practice and performance, to use it to understand dance gets things backwards. This view may have some merit (indeed, the same can be said of philosophy of dance), but Sparshott goes so far as to say that criticism is entirely worthless for understanding dance; that it “is not a discipline” and as such does not mark any distinctive area for dance understanding (1995, 338). He does, however, acknowledge that critics can serve the practical danceworld purpose of being intermediaries who can situate the dance in dance practice and history and who can “tell us what to look for, so that we can see the design in the work and discern the relation between work and performance” (1995, 339). If this is true then Sparshott must believe that dance criticism can help when assisted by dance philosophy, even if he thinks it cannot be of great value to our understanding of dance on its own.

For more on dance criticism, see Anderson 1989, Barnes 1976, Carter 1976 and 1983, Copeland and Cohen 1983 (which highlights the difficulty of accurate description for dance criticism), Copeland 1993 (which discusses critic Deborah Jowitt’s descriptive view of dance criticism in particular), Banes 1994 (which discusses dance criticism during the postmodern period), Banes 2007, and Lavender 2000–2001 (which discusses post-historical dance criticism in relation to Danto’s end of art theory). For work by some of the major dance critics who have been inspirational for dance philosophers see Croce 1985 and 2000, Denby 1986, Gautier 1986, Jowitt 1989 and 1998, Martin 1933a, 1933b, 1939 and 1945, Ménéstrier 1669 and 1682, Noverre 1760, and Siegel 1972, 1983 and 1985.

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  • –––, 1998, “The Ontology of Dance,” in the Encyclopedia of Aesthetics, M. Kelly (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, online edition. See also 2014, “Ontology of Art: Ontology of Dance,” in the Encyclopedia of Aesthetics, Second Edition, Vol. 5, M. Kelly (ed.), New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 15–17.
  • –––, 2006, “A Pragmatic Approach to the Identity of Works of Art,” Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 20 (1): 42–55.
  • –––, 2009, “Dance,” in A Companion to Aesthetics, 2d ed., S. Davies, K. M. Higgins, R. Hopkins, R. Stecker, and D. E. Cooper (eds.), Malden and West Sussex: Wiley-Blackwell, pp. 76–78.
  • Zaporah, R., 2003, “Dance: A Body with a Mind of Its Own,” in Taken by Surprise: A Dance Improvisation Reader, A. C. Albright and D. Gere (eds.), Hanover, CT: Wesleyan University Press, pp. 21–26.

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

Here I would like to thank the members of the DancePhilosophers Google group who provided suggestions for texts and readings in the development of this article, particularly Julie Van Camp. I would also like to thank the editors of the SEP for their support of dance philosophy. Special thanks are also given to Stephen Davies, in particular for his help in understanding the ontology of music in relation to dance.

Copyright © 2015 by
Aili Bresnahan <abresnahan1@udayton.edu>

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