Table of Contents
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The seven known manuscripts of the Abstractiones date from the late thirteenth to the early fourteenth centuries:[3]
Ms B= Brugge, Stedelike Bibliotheek, 497Only two of these manuscripts (B, D) are complete; the remaining five are in varying degrees of fragmentation. Two manuscripts (O, R) appear to be derivative texts, or redactions, of the Abstractiones.
Ms C= Oxford, Corpus Christi College, E 293B
Ms D= Oxford, Bodleian Library, Digby 24
Ms K= København, Det Kongelige Bibliotek, Fragm.1075
Ms O= Oxford, Bodleian Library, Digby 2
Ms P= Paris, Bibliothèque Nationale lat. 14069
Ms R= London, British Library, Royal 12.F.xix
The dating of the composition of the Abstractiones appears to have been around the 1230's or 40's. Earliest references to the Abstractiones appear from the late thirteenth century in a manuscript at Worcester Cathedral Library, Q. 13, which is confidently dated no later than 1295, and probably as early as 1270.[4] Worcester Q. 13 contains four references to the "Magister Abstractionum". Another reference to the Abstractiones can be found in a Quodlibetal Question of William of Alnwick, "Does God know infinitely many things (Utrum Deus cognoscat infinita)?", q. 9 probably dating from around 1320. Walter Burley's tract, De Exceptivis, edited by L. M. de Rijk, contains a reference to the Magister Abstractionum.[5] An interesting reference can also be found in William of Ockham's Summa Logicae and additional references can be found in Ps. Richard of Campsall, John of Reading and Adam Wodeham.[6]
The fact of the existence of two derivative texts of the Abstractiones as well as the numerous known references by accomplished logicians some seventy years after its composition indicate that the Abstractiones was a quite popular book that survived the test of time. Although as compared to sophism literature of the fourteenth century Richard's analysis of sophisms appears somewhat unsophisticated, as compared to treatments of sophisms of his contemporaries Richard's analyses are qualitatively similar. Richard's greatest accomplishment lay, perhaps, in his ability to encapsulate and summarize a huge number of such logical puzzles, presenting for the student a handy reference book filled with examples of a host of logical fallacies.
(1) Every man is every man (Omnis homo est omnis homo)From the above rather small list of sophisms, it can already be noticed that some sentences are more complex, and thus more logically puzzling, than others. Some sentences do not seem puzzling in themselves at all, but become puzzling only within a certain "context" that is set up within which arguments proving and disproving the sophism must be developed. Such a context was called a "casus".[7] It seems likely that the proving and disproving of the sophism sentence was done along the lines of a medieval oral "disputatio" within the classroom setting. This is the way Richard writes up his summaries: Proposal of the sophism, sometimes within a casus; arguments establishing the truth of the sentence; arguments establishing the falsity of the sentence; resolution of the sophism along with identification of the sophistical fallacy involved.(16) Whatever exists or does not exist exists (Quicquid est vel non est est)
(39) Everything other than an animal which plus Socrates are two differs from Socrates (Omne aliud quam animal quod et Sortes sunt duo differt a Sorte)
(79) The whole Socrates is less than Socrates (Totus Sortes est minor Sorte)
(96) If you know that you are a stone you do not know that you are a stone (Si tu scis te esse lapidem tu non scis te esse lapidem)
(157) Nothing is true about nothing (De nihilo nihil est verum)
(187) You have not ceased to eat iron (Tu non cessas comedere ferrum)
(215) All ten except one are nine (Omnia X praeter unum sunt IX)
(278) It is impossible that you know more than you know (Impossibile est te scire plura quam scis)
The very first sophism sentence treated is one of the least complicated (this sophism involves no casus):
Every man is every manAs noted, this sophism sentence is relatively uncomplicated and it is easy to spot the obvious fallacy involved, but Richard's text proceeds with increasingly more difficult and intricate sophism sentences, many of which engage the mind in complex mental acrobatics. The fallacies noted throughout are the standard ones discussed in Aristotle's De Sophisticis Elenchis: the fallacy of equivocation; the fallacy of accident; the fallacy of the composite and divided senses; the fallacy of the consequent; the fallacy of absolute and qualified senses; the fallacy of many causes of truth; amphiboly; improper supposition.Proof: This man is this man, that man is that man and so forth for each individual man, therefore every man is every man.
Another proof: No proposition is more true than one in which the same thing is predicated of the same thing....
Disproof: This proposition is true, "some man is not every man" and, similarly, "no man is every man"; therefore it is false that every man is every man.
Solution: The solution to the sophism is to note that "every man" is equivocal as to reference to every man taken singularly (as in "any man") and as to every man taken as a whole (as in "all men"). Mixing the two senses of "every" from subject to predicate causes the logical puzzle.
Expliciunt ista, quae tu, Ricarde Sophista,De Rijk suggested the name Richard Fishacre, disagreeing with the suggestion of Richard Fitz-Ralph offered by Macray on the basis that the dating of the text within the second quarter of the thirteenth century is more consistent with Fishacre's chronology.[8] Jan Pinborg suggested the name Richard Rufus also on grounds that the dating of the Abstractiones is consistent with Rufus' being at Oxford.[9] It is generally assumed that the author is English. Pinborg offered one further bit of evidence for the name Richard Rufus in that there is some reason to think that certain doctrines of Richard Rufus, as criticised by Roger Bacon, are in the Abstractiones. The primary doctrine in question attributed to Richard Rufus and criticised by Roger Bacon is, in general terms, that the signification of a name can remain in the absence of any actual thing signified by that name, although, as Bacon suggests, the proponents of this view must supply some kind of "habitual being" for the lost actual significate of such names. It is this doctrine of the "esse habituale" that Bacon finds objectionable. That Richard Rufus does seem to have such a doctrine appears clear in his discussion of the question "Whether Christ while three days in the tomb was a man" ("Utrum Christus in triduo mortis fuerit homo") in distinction 22, book III of his Sentences Commentary.[10]
fecesti, morum flos et doctor logicorum.
Dirige scribentis, Spiritus alme, manum.
Expliciunt Abstractiones.
(Digby 24, f.90rb)(These [sophisms] are complete, which you, Richard the Sophister,
Flower of virtue and teacher of logic, have produced.
Turn the scribe's hand [from its task], nurturing Spirit.
The Abstractiones are complete.)
It would be beyond the scope of this essay to deal with the complexities of both Richard Rufus' treatment of this question as well as Roger Bacon's voiceful criticisms of the doctrine of the "esse habituale". The important question for our purposes is whether the doctrine espoused by Richard Rufus exactly parallels anything that can be found in the Abstractiones of Richardus Sophista that would warrant the conclusion that these two Richards are the same individual. I have answered this question in detail elsewhere, and it will suffice here to state the conclusion that although there might seem to be terminological similarities in the Sentences Commentary discussion of Rufus and the Abstractiones of Richardus Sophista, it is clear that there are no doctrinal similarities, and that the use made of the distinction between what Richardus Sophista labels "esse habitudinis" and "esse operatio entis" does not parallel the distinction between "esse habituale" and "esse actuale" as we find it in Rufus. Indeed, even the terminological similarities are less than clear. The Magister Abstractionum's use of the distinction matches the use of it made by William Sherwood as fundamentally a distinction between two types of propositions, the former hypothetical, the latter categorical.[11] And it has been successfully argued by Braakhuis that Sherwood's use of the distinction does not come under the attacks of Roger Bacon, although Sherwood actually uses the terminology "esse habituale/esse actuale" to mark the distinction between hypothetical and categorical interpretations of (the copula of) grammatically categorical propositions, which the Magister Abstractionum expresses by using the terminology "esse habitudinis/esse operatio entis".[12] Thus, in so far as the doctrine in Sherwood is similar to that in the Abstractiones, it cannot parallel anything attacked by Bacon as attributed to Rufus. Thus it seems that we cannot identify our Richard as Richard Rufus on the basis of this alleged doctrinal similarity. In a recent book on the theology of Richard Rufus of Cornwall, Peter Raedts has also tried to dismiss Pinborg's attempt to claim Rufus as the author of the Abstractiones.[13] Raedts' main argument is that Rufus does not within his theological writings evince the kind of logical acumen that one associates with the author of a collection of logical sophisms. This is not a very persuasive point, however, since it is well known that medieval philosophers could move from sophisticated theological discussions to logical analysis with ease and expertise. At this point, therefore, we must be content with the meagre information that the author of the Abstractiones was an English scholar writing and studying at Oxford during the second quarter of the thirteenth century whose name was Richard, remembering, as Raedts notes, that the supply of Richards at Oxford at this time was "bountiful indeed".
First published: August 4, 1999
Content last modified: August 4, 1999