A dynamic encyclopedia following the above plan, therefore, needs the following administrative staff: an Editor, a computer consultant, and an Editorial Board. The Editor will coordinate the activities of the encyclopedia and maintain the encyclopedia's host machine. Maintenance of the host machine does require some general system administration skills, such as updating the httpd installation and search engines, preparing a sample entry that demonstrates entry style, and maintaining the authors' accounts. A computer consultant will write the scripts described above, oversee the technical development of the project, and apprise the Editor of new developments taking place on the Internet.* Though an advisory board is not necessary, we have one to help us choose the members of our Editorial Board. The Editorial Board will be responsible for soliciting qualified authors to write entries on appropriate topics, and also for evaluating the entries contributed by the authors they solicit.
With a larger budget and support staff, a complete `work-flow' analysis could be developed, which noted and recorded the various (kinds of) transactions between editor and authors and between editor and board member. The Encyclopedia database should keep track of more information about the state of an entry than ours does.* At some point, we plan to develop a program which automatically sends out notices when it is time for the author of a particular entry to update their entry or bibliography. No doubt there are other ways to automate administrative tasks, and when time and money permit, we plan to implement them.
Although we have designed our dynamic encyclopedia principally with an eye toward solving the update problem, such an encyclopedia has other advantages. One is that there are no constraints on the length or number of entries other than that imposed by disk space. This feature easily accommodates multiple entries on a single topic (each reflecting a separate perspective). Another advantage is ease of distribution. By distributing the encyclopedia over the World Wide Web, it becomes accessible to anyone with Internet access. A third advantage is that the pace at which the encyclopedia can be published is limited by the fastest rather the slowest authors. There is no longer a lag between the time the entry is sent to the Editors and the time the entry can be published. Finally, since entries can be improved over time, any biases they may reflect can be found and eliminated. Thus, our solution to the problem of updating encyclopedias also provides a solution to the problem of avoiding bias in encyclopedias.