Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Mental Imagery

Mental Imagery Bibliography

This is an extensive, but inevitably incomplete, bibliography of the science and philosophy of mental imagery (it includes the items listed in the selected bibliography on the main entry page). Many, but not all, of the works listed here are cited and discussed in the text of the entry on Mental Imagery, or its supplements. Many items here are annotated, but lack of an annotation should not be taken as an implicit comment on the value or interest of the work in question.

Other works that are cited in the entry, or the supplements, but that themselves say little or nothing directly about imagery, are listed in the supplementary bibliography of cited works not about mental imagery.

Abell, C. (2005). Review of Zenon Pylyshyn's Seeing and Visualizing: It's Not What You Think. Psyche (11 #1). Online serial, URL: http://psyche.cs.monash.edu.au/book_reviews/pylyshyn/
Abell, C. & Currie, G. (1999). Internal and External Pictures. Philosophical Psychology (12) 429-445.
Mental images and physical pictures may both be regarded as simulations, but of different sorts. Kosslyn's quasi-pictorialism is rejected, and it is argued that the finding of picture-like activation structures in the retinotopic maps in brain during imagery is "not in itself evidence for pictorialism."
Abelson, R.P. (1979). Imagining the Purpose of Imagery. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2) 548-549.
Ahsen, A. (1965). Eidetic Psychotherapy: A Short Introduction. New York: Brandon House.
Ahsen, A. (1977). Eidetics: An Overview. Journal of Mental Imagery (1) 5-38.
Ahsen A. (1984). ISM: The Triple Code Model for Imagery and Psychophysiology. Journal of Mental Imagery (8) 15-42.
Ahsen, A. (1985). Unvividness Paradox. Journal of Mental Imagery (9) 1-18.
Ahsen, A. (1993). Imagery Paradigm: Imaginative Consciousness in the Experimental and Clinical Setting. New York: Brandon House.
Ahsen, A. (1999). Hot and Cold Mental Imagery: Mind over Body Encounters. New York: Brandon House.
Aleman, A., Van Lee, L., Mantione, M., Verkoijen, I. & De Haan, E. H. D. (2001). Visual Imagery Without Visual Experience: Evidence from Congenitally Totally Blind People. NeuroReport (12) 2601-2604.
Evidence suggesting that the congenitally blind can have visual mental imagery; but see Kerr & Domhoff (2004) for critique of such claims.
Amedi, A. Malach, R., & Pascual-Leone, A. (2005). Negative BOLD Differentiates Visual Imagery and Perception. Neuron (48) 859-872.
Non-visual sensory brain areas show reduced activation during visual imagery (but not during visual perception).
Anderson, J.R. (1978). Arguments Concerning Representations for Mental Imagery. Psychological Review (85) 249-77.
Argues that the analog vs.propositional (picture vs. description) question is ill posed.
Anderson, J.R. (1979). Further Arguments Concerning Representations for Mental Imagery: A Response to Hayes-Roth and Pylyshyn. Psychological Review (86) 395-406.
Anderson, J.R. (1983). The Architecture of Cognition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Anderson, J.R. & Bower G.H. (1973). Human Associative Memory. Washington D.C.: Winston/ New York: Wiley.
An early critique of Dual Coding Theory from a computational, common coding perspective.
Anderson, R.E. (1998). Imagery and Spatial Representation. In W. Bechtel & G. Graham (Eds.) A Companion to Cognitive Science (pp. 204-211). Oxford: Blackwell.
Review article.
Andrade, J., Kavanagh, D., & Baddeley, A.D. (1997). Eye-Movements and Visual Imagery: A Working Memory Approach to the Treatment of Post-Traumatic Stress Disorder. British Journal of Clinical Psychology (36) 209-223.
Antonietti, A. (1999). Can Students Predict When Imagery Will Allow Them to Discover the Problem Solution? European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (11) 407-428.
Antrobus, J.S., Antrobus, J.S., & Singer, J.L. (1964). Eye Movements Accompanying Daydreaming, Visual Imagery, and Thought Suppression. Journal of Abnormal and Social Psychology (69) 244-252.
Arditi, A., Holtzman, J. D., & Kosslyn, S. M. (1988). Mental Imagery and Sensory Experience in Congenital Blindness. Neuropsychologia (26) 1-12.
Arp, R. (2005). Scenario Visualization: One Explanation of Creative Problem Solving. Journal of Consciousness Studies (12, iii) 31-60.
Argues, from the standpoint of Evolutionary Psychology and the theory of the modular mind, for the key role of imagery in innovative and creative thought and problem solving.
Atwood, G. (1971). An Experimental Study of Visual Imagination and Imagery. Cognitive Psychology (2) 290-299.
A demonstration of the selective interference effect in a memory task. For a more methodologically satisfactory demonstration of same, see Janssen (1976a, 1976b).
Audi, R. (1978). The Ontological Status of Mental Images. Inquiry (21) 348-361.
Aveling E. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the Process of Thinking 2. British Journal of Psychology (18) 15-22.
A companion piece to Pear (1927) and Bartlett (1927).
Ayers, M. (1986). Are Locke's “Ideas” Images, Intentional Objects or Natural Signs? The Locke Newsletter (17) 3-36.
See comment on Ayers (1991).
Ayers, M. (1991). Locke: Epistemology and Ontology (2 volumes). London: Routledge. (Page references are to the single volume edition of 1993.)
Argues that the ideas of Locke should be understood to be mental images. For the opposing view see Yolton (e.g., 1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996), Chappell (1994), or Lowe (1995, 2005).
Baars, B.J. (Ed.) (1996). Special issue on mental imagery of Consciousness and Cognition (5-iii).
Baddeley, A.D. (1976). The Psychology of Memory. London: Harper.
Baddeley, A.D. (1994). Working Memory. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Baddeley, A.D., Grant, S., Wright, E., & Thompson, N. (1975). Imagery and Visual Working Memory. In P.M.A. Rabbit & S. Dornic (Eds.), Attention and Performance 5. London: Academic Press.
A demonstration of the selective interference effect (cf. Brooks, 1968).
Baddeley, A.D. & Hitch, G. (1974). Working Memory. In G.H. Bower (Ed.) The Psychology of Learning and Motivation, Vol. 8. New York & London: Academic Press.
Baddeley, A.D. & Lieberman, K. (1980). Spatial Working Memory. In R.S. Nickerson (Ed.), Attention and Performance VIII. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Demonstates the spatial basis of the selective interference effect.
Barber, T.X. (1959). The Afterimages of “Hallucinated” and “Imagined” Colors. Journal of Abnormal and Social Psychology (59) 136-139.
Experimental demonstration that, in some subjects, negative afterimages may be induced by purely imagined colors.
Barolo, E., Masini, R. & Antonietti, A. (1990) Mental Rotation of Solid Objects and Problem-Solving in Sighted and Blind Subjects. Journal of Mental Imagery (14) 65-74.
As well as confirming the occurence of mental rotation in blind subjects, this challenges the empirical claims of Hinton (1979).
Barquero, B. & Logie, R.H. (1999). Imagery Constraints on Quantitative and Qualitative Aspects of Mental Synthesis. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (11) 315-333.
Barsalou, L.W. (1993). Flexibility, Structure, and Linguistic Vagary in Concepts: Manifestations of a Compositional System of Perceptual Symbols. In A. Collins, S. Gathercole, M. Conway, and P. Morris (Eds.), Theories of Memory. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Barsalou, L.W. (1999). Perceptual Symbol Systems (with commentaries and author's reply). Behavioral and Brain Sciences (22) 577-660. Preprint available online
Purportedly not directly about imagery, but deals with the closely adjacent topic of mental representations that are inherently perceptual in character, and argues that they are adequate to account for cognition, and explanatorily superior to “amodal” conceptions of representation (such as mentalese) For some recent supporting evidence, that also makes the link with imagery explicit, see Kan et al. (2003), and for some philosophical support see Nyíri (2001) and Prinz (2002).
Barsalou, L.W., & Prinz, J.J. (1997). Mundane Creativity in Perceptual Symbol Systems. In T.B. Ward, S.M. Smith, & J. Vaid (Eds.), Conceptual Structures and Processes: Emergence, Discovery, and Change (pp. 267-307). Washington, DC: American Psychological Association.
Barsalou, L.W., Simmons, W.K., Barbey, A.K., & Wilson, C.D. (2003). Grounding Conceptual Knowledge in Modality Specific Systems. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7), 84-91.
Bartlett, F.C. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the Process of Thinking. British Journal of Psychology (18) 23-29.
A companion piece to Pear (1927) and Aveling (1927).
Bartlett, F.C. (1932). Remembering. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Bartolomeo, P. (2002). The Relationship Between Visual perception and Visual Mental Imagery: A Reappraisal of the Neuropsychological Evidence. Cortex (38) 357-378. Available online from the Cortex archive (also here)
Reviews the clinical evidence on deficits in visual mental imagery (and related deficits in visual perception) resulting from brain injury. He concludes that the evidence is not consistent with the Quasi-Pictorial Theory of Kosslyn (1980, 1994), but favors an enactive theory. See also, Bartolomeo & Chokron (2002).
Bartolomeo, P. (2007). Visual Neglect. Current Opinion in Neurology (20) 381-386. Preprint available online
A review of current knowledge about unilateral neglect, including imaginal neglect.
Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A.-C., Azouvi, P., & Chokron, S. (2005). Time to Imagine Space: A Chronometric Exploration of Representational Neglect. Neuropsychologia (43) 1249-57. Available online
Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A-C., De Gelder, B. Denes, G., G., Dalla Barba, G., Brugieres, P. & Degos, J.-P. (1998). Multiple-Domain Dissociation between Impaired Visual Perception and Preserved Mental Imagery in a Patient with Bilateral Extrastriate Lesions. Neuropsychologia (36) 239-249. Available online
Neurological evidence suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early visual areas of the brain. For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999). See Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for further review of this issue and an attempt to reconcile the conflicting findings from neuroimaging studies, but see also Bartolomeo (2002) for more on the neurological evidence.
Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A-C., & Denes, G. (1997). Preserved Imagery for Colours in a Patient with Cerebral Achromatopsia. Cortex (33) 369-378. Available online from the Cortex archive
See note on previous item.
Bartolomeo, P. & Chokron, S. (2001). Levels of Impairment in Unilateral Neglect. In M. Behrmann (Ed.) Handbook of Neuropsychology (2nd edn.), Volume 3: Disorders of Visual Behavior (pp. 67-98). Amsterdam: Elsevier Science. Preprint available online
Includes a discussion of imaginal neglect.
Bartolomeo, P. & Chokron, S. (2002). Can We Change our Vantage Point to Explore Imaginal Neglect? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 184-185. Available online
A commentary on Pylyshyn (2002a). Expands on the argument made by Bartolomeo (2002), that the evidence concerning the neurological syndrome of representational neglect (Bisiach & Luzzatti, 1978; Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, 1994) is not consistent with either quasi-pictorial or propositional theories of imagery, but favors enactive theory.
Bartolomeo, P., D'Erme, P., & Gainotti, G. (1994). The Relation between Visuospatial Neglect and Representational Neglect. Neurology (44) 1710-1714.
See Bisiach & Luzzatti (1978).
Basso, A., Bisiach, E., & Luzzatti, C. (1980). Loss of Mental Imagery: A Case Study. Neuropsychologia (18) 435-442.
Baylor, G.W. (1972). A Treatise on the Mind's Eye: An Empirical Investigation of Visual Mental Imagery. Ph.D. thesis, Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA. (University Microfilms 72-12, 699.)
The first serious attempt to simulate imagery computationally. The major inspiration for the description theory of Pylyshyn (1973).
Baylor, G.W. (1973). Modelling the Mind's Eye. In A. Elithorn & D. Jones (Eds.), Artificial and Human Thinking. Amsterdam: Elsevier.
A brief sketch of the model detailed in Baylor (1972).
Beare, J.I. (1906). Greek Theories of Elementary Cognition: From Alcmaeon to Aristotle. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Behrmann, M. (2000). The Mind's Eye Mapped Onto the Brain's Matter. Current Directions in Psychological Science (9) 50-54.
A brief review of evidence on neural structures supporting visual mental imagery, from an uncritically quasi-pictorialist perspective.
Belardinelli, M.O., Di Matteo, R., Del Gratta, C., De Nicola, A., Ferretti A., Tartaro, A., Bonomo, L., & Romani, G.L. (2004). Intermodal Sensory Image Generation: An fMRI Analysis. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (16) 729-752.
Finds that the left middle-inferior temporal area of the brain is activated by imagery tasks in any sensory modality.
Bennett, M.R. & Hacker, P.M.S. (2003). Philosophical Foundations of Neuroscience. Oxford: Blackwell.
The central thesis of this book, strongly influenced by Wittgenstein, is that mental states, processes, characteristics, experiences, etc. are not properly attributed to brains, but, rather, only to whole persons or organisms. In chapter 6, cognitive theories that treat mental images as inner representations, embodied as brain states, are criticized and rejected from this perspective.
Bensafi, M., Porter, J., Pouliot, S., Mainland, J., Johnson, B., Zelano, C., Young, N., Bremner, E., Aframian, D., Kahn, R., & Sobel, N. (2003). Olfactomotor Activity During Imagery Mimics that During Perception. Nature Neuroscience (6) 1142-1144.
Provides some direct support for an enactive account (Thomas, 1999b) of olfactory imagery. Analogous to the findings of Brandt & Stark (1997) and Laeng & Teodorescu (2002) on eye movements during visual imagery.
Berbaum, K. & Chung, C.S. (1981). Müller-Lyer Illusion Induced by Imagination. Journal of Mental Imagery (5) 125-128.
Probably subject to the same objections as the similar work of Wallace (1984) (q.v.). However, Pressey & Wilson (1974) obtained comparable results from what appears to be a better designed experiment.
Berger, R.J., Olley, P., & Oswald, I. (1962). The EEG, Eye-Movements and Dreams of the Blind. Quaterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (14) 183-186.
Bergson, H. (1907). Creative Evolution. (Authorized translation from the original French by A. Mitchell: New York: Holt, 1911.)
Chapter 4 deals with “the cinematographical mechanism of thought,” Bergson's account of the nature and limitations of image thinking.
Berkeley, G. (1734). A Treatise Concerning the Principles of Human Knowledge. (In M.R. Ayers (Ed.), George Berkeley: Philosophical Works Including the Works on Vision (2nd edn.). London: Dent, 1975. )
The ideas of Berkeley's philosophy are, to all intents and purposes, mental images.
Bértolo, H. (2005). Visual Imagery Without Visual Perception? Psicólogia (26) 173-188. Reprint available online
Claims that the congenitally blind can have visual mental imagery; but see Kerr & Domhoff (2004).
Betts, G.H. (1909). The Distribution and Functions of Mental Imagery. New York: Teachers College, Columbia University.
A seminal, questionnaire-based investigation of individual differences in imagery vividness and in the frequency of the spontaneous occurence of imagery in thinking. The Betts Questionnaire upon Mental Imagery (QMI) continues to be used in vividness research (although usually as modified and abbreviated by Sheehan (1967)). However, the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973, 1999) is also widely used.
Bexton, W.H., Heron, W., & Scott, T.H. (1954). Effects of Decreased Variation in the Sensory Environment. Canadian Journal of Psychology (8) 70-76.
Sensory deprivation discovered to give rise to spontaneous and bizarre imagery.
Bianca, M.L. & Foglia, L. (Eds.) (2006). Mental Imagery and Visual Perception. Special issue of the journal Anthropology & Philosophy (7 #1-2).
Bisiach, E. & Berti, A. (1990). Waking Images and Neural Activity. In R.G. Kunzendorf & A.A. Sheikh (Eds.) The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application. Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Bisiach, E., Capitani, E., Luzzatti, C., & Perani, D. (1981). Brain and Conscious Representation of Outside Reality. Neuropsychologia (19) 543-551.
Bisiach, E. & Luzzatti, C. (1978). Unilateral Neglect of Representational Space. Cortex (14) 129-133.
The first scientific description of the phenomenon of representational neglect: brain damaged patients who ignore things to their left also ignore the left side in their imagery. Also see the next item, and: Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, (1994), Coslett (1997).
Bisiach, E., Luzzatti, C., & Perani, D. (1979). Unilateral Neglect, Representational Schema and Consciousness. Brain (102) 609-618.
Blachowicz, J. (1997). Analog Representation Beyond Mental Imagery. Journal of Philosophy (94) 55-84.
Blain, P.J. (2006). A Computer Model of Creativity Based on Perceptual Activity Theory. Unpublished doctoral dissertation, Griffith University, Queensland, Australia. Available online
Describes a computer model of imagery and its role in creativity based on the enactive (perceptual activity) theory of imagery (Thomas, 1999b, 2002; Neisser, 1976), and the closely related sensorimotor/enactive theory of perception (O'Regan & Noë, 2001; Noë, 2004). Blain defends the enactive theory of imagery against a number of potential criticisms, and argues that the successfully implemented computer model proves that it is computationally viable.
Block, N. (Ed.) (1981a). Imagery. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Widely read collection of philosophical and theoretical pieces concerned with the analog/propositional debate.
Block, N. (Ed.) (1981b). Readings in Philosophy of Psychology, Vol. 2. London: Methuen.
Section on imagery adds to and complements the above.
Block, N. (1983a). Mental Pictures and Cognitive Science. Philosophical Review (92) 499-539.
Block, N. (1983b). The Photographic Fallacy and the Debate about Mental Imagery. Noûs (17) 651-661.
Blumenthal, H.J. (1976). Plotinus' Adaptation of Aristotle's Psychology: Sensation, Imagination and Memory. In R.B. Harris (Ed.), The Significance of Neoplatonism (pp. 41-58). Norfolk, VA: International Society for Neoplatonic Studies.
Blumenthal, H.J. (1977-8). Neoplatonic Interpretations of Aristotle on Phantasia. Review of Metaphysics (31) 242-257.
Blumenthal, H.J. (1996). Aristotle and Neoplatonism in Late Antiquity: Interpretations of the De Anima. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Bodner, G.M. & Guay, R.B. (1997). The Purdue Visualization of Rotations Test. The Chemical Educator (2, #4) 1-18.
Boodin, J.E. (1921). Sensation, Imagination and Consciousness. Psychological Review (28) 425-454.
Bower, G.H. (1970). Imagery as a Relational Organizer in Associative Memory. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (9) 529-533.
Bower, G.H. (1972). Mental Imagery and Associative Learning. In L.W. Gregg (Ed.), Cognition in Learning and Memory. New York: Wiley.
Bower, K.J. (1984). Imagery: From Hume to Cognitive Science. Canadian Journal of Philosophy (14) 217-234.
Defends the view that mental images are copies of (in the same format as) percepts.
Brandimonte, M.A. & Gerbino, W. (1993). Mental Image Reversal and Verbal Recoding: When Ducks Become Rabbits. Memory and Cognition (21) 23-33.
Brandt, S.A. & Stark, L.W. (1997). Spontaneous Eye Movements During Visual Imagery Reflect the Content of the Visual Scene. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (9) 27-38.
Some direct experimental support of a enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). This work has been recently replicated and extended by Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), and Johansson et al. (2005, 2006). Similar evidence comes from Demarais & Cohen (1998), Spivey & Geng (2001), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), and Hong et al. (1997).
Brann, E.T.H. (1991). The World of the Imagination: Sum and Substance. Savage, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
An ambitious philosophical history of conceptions of imagination and imagery, from ancient to contemporary times.
Brett, E.A. & Ostroff, R. (1985). Imagery and Posttraumatic Stress Disorder: An Overview. American Journal of Psychiatry (142) 417-424.
Brewer, W.F. & Schommer-Aikins, M. (2006). Scientists Are Not Deficient in Mental Imagery: Galton Revised. Review of General Psychology (10) 130-146.
Galton's own data (1880, 1883) do not support his oft quoted conclusion that scientists tend to be deficient in imagery (see also, Burbridge, 1994). Neither does a new attempt to replicate his study.
Brodie, A. (1986-7). Medieval Notions and the Theory of Ideas. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (86) 153-167.
Broerse, J. & Crassini, B. (1980). The Influence of Imagery Ability on Color Aftereffects Produced by Physically Present and Imagined Induction Stimuli. Perception and Psychophysics (28) 560-580.
Challenges the results of Finke & Schmidt (1977, 1978).
Broerse, J. & Crassini, B. (1984). Investigations of Perception and Imagery Using CAEs: The Role of Experimental Design and Psychophysical Method. Perception and Psychophysics (35) 155-164.
Challenges the results of Finke & Schmidt (1977, 1978).
Brooks, L.R. (1967). The Suppression of Visualization by Reading. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (19) 287-299.
Brooks, L. R. (1968). Spatial and Verbal Components of the Act of Recall. Canadian Journal of Psychology (22) 349-368.
The classic demonstration of selective interference between spatial perception and spatial (including visual) imagery. See Hampson & Duffy (1984) for a replication in congenitally blind subjects, and De Beni & Moè (2003) for a more recent study of the effect.
Brown, B.B. (1968). Visual Recall Ability and Eye Movements. Psychophysiology (4) 300-306.
Bugelski, B.R. (1970). Words and Things and Images. American Psychologist (25) 1002-10012.
On imagery effects in verbal learning experiments.
Bugelski, B.R. (1971). The Definition of the Image. In S.J. Segal (Ed.) Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches. New York: Academic Press.
Bugelski, B.R. (1977). Mnemonics. In International Encyclopedia of Psychiatry, Psychology, Psychoanalysis, and Neurology, Vol. 7. New York: Van Nostrand Reinhold.
Bugelski, (1979). Eidetic Posession: Is Exorcism Necessary? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 598-599.
Skeptical as to whether eidetic imagery is a genuine phenomenon. (A commentary on Haber (1979).)
Bugelski, B.R. (1984). Imagery. In R.J. Corsini (Ed.), Encyclopedia of Psychology, Vol. 2 (pp.185-187). New York: Wiley.
Bugelski, B.R., Kidd, E., & Segmen, J. (1968). Image as a Mediator in One Trial Paired Associate Learning. Journal of Experimental Psychology (76) 69-73.
Bundy, M.W. (1927). The Theory of Imagination in Classical and Mediaeval Thought (University of Illinois Studies in Language and Literature. Vol.12). Urbana IL: University of Illinois Press. (Reprinted by Norwood Editions, 1978.)
Mainly concerned with imagination from the perspective of aesthetics.
Burbridge, D. (1994). Galton’s 100: An Exploration of Francis Galton’s Imagery Studies. British Journal for the History of Science (27) 443-463.
Some of Galton's best known claims about individual differences in imagery, and the lack of imagery, may not be well supported by his actual results (see also, Brewer & Schommer-Aikins, 2006).
Calkins, M.W. (Ed.) (1963). The Metaphysical System of Hobbes. La Salle, IL: Open Court.
Contains translated extracts from the Latin works in which Hobbes discusses cognition in general and imagery in particular. However, not a great deal is added to the account to be found in Leviathan (Hobbes, 1651).
Caplan, H. (1930). Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola: On the Imagination: The Latin Text with an Introduction, an English Translation, and Notes. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
Candlish, S. (1975). Mental Images and Pictorial Properties. Mind (84) 260-262.
A critique of Hannay's (1971) defense of pictorialism.
Candlish, S. (1976). The Incompatibility of Perception and Imagery: A Contemporary Orthodoxy. American Philosophical Quarterly (13) 63-68.
Stewart Candlish informs me that the title of this article was misprinted in the published version. The title given here is the one he intended.
Candlish, S. (2001). Mental Imagery. In S. Schroeder (Ed.), Wittgenstein and Contemporary Philosophy of Mind. London: Palgrave.
Discusses Wittgenstein's views on imagery, and their influence.
Carpenter, P.A. & Eisenberg, P. (1978). Mental Rotation and the Frame of Reference in Blind and Sighted Individuals. Perception and Psychophysics (23) 117-124.
Mental rotation effect (Shepard & Cooper, 1982) demonstrated in congenitally blind subjects using tactile stimuli (cf. Marmor & Zaback, 1976; and see also: Jonides, Kahn, & Rozin, 1975; Kerr, 1983; Zimler & Keenan, 1983).
Carpenter, P.A. & Just, M.A. (1978). Eye Fixations During Mental Rotation. In J.W. Senders, D.F. Fisher, & R.A. Monty (Eds.), Eye Movements and the Higher Psychological Functions (pp. 115-133). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
A study of the Shepard & Metzler (1971) mental rotation task. See also Just & Carpenter (1976).
Carruthers, M.J. (1990). The Book of Memory: A Study of Memory in Medieval Culture. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Discusses the mnemonic techniques (mostly imagery based) that were in wide use in medieval times, and considers their effect on medieval intellectual culture in general (see also: Yates, 1966; Carruthers, 1998; Rossi, 2000).
Carruthers, M.J. (1998). The Craft of Thought: Meditation, Rhetoric, and the Making of Images, 400-1200. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Casey, E.S. (1971). Imagination: Imagining and the Image. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (31) 475-90.
Casey, E.S. (1976). Imagining: A Phenomenological Study. Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
Casey, E.S. (1977-8). Imagining and Remembering. Review of Metaphysics (31) 187-209.
Caston, V. (1996). Why Aristotle Needs Imagination. Phronesis (41) 20-55.
Chambers, D. (1993). Images are Both Depictive and Descriptive. In B. Roskos-Ewoldsen, M.J. Intons-Peterson & R.E. Anderson (Eds.), Imagery, Creativity and Discovery: A Cognitive Perspective (pp. 77-97). Amsterdam: Elsevier.
Chambers, D. & Reisberg, D. (1985). Can Mental Images be Ambiguous? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (11) 317-328.
A very striking experiment; but see Peterson et al. (1992), Rollins (1994), Cornoldi et al, (1996), Slezak (1991, 1995), and other listed works by Chambers and/or Reisberg for related (and often conflicting) experimental results, and competing interpretations.
Chambers, D. & Reisberg, D. (1992). What an Image Depicts Depends on What an Image Means: An Image of a Duck Does Not Include a Rabbit's Nose. Cognitive Psychology (24) 145-174.
Chappell, V. (1994). Locke's Theory of Ideas. In V. Chappell (Ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Locke (pp. 26-55). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Argues that the ideas of Locke should not be understood to be mental images (see also Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996), and Lowe (1995, 2005)). For the opposing view see Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), or Price (1953).
Chatterjee, A. & Southwood, M. H. (1995). Cortical Blindness and Visual Imagery. Neurology (45) 2189-2195.
Chisholm, R.M. (1942). The Problem of the Speckled Hen. Mind (51) 368-373.
Chokron, S., Colliot, P., & Bartolomeo, P. (2004). The Role of Vision in Spatial Representation. Cortex (40) 281-290. Available online from the Cortex archive
Clark, J.M. & Paivio, A. (1989). Observational and Theoretical Terms in Psychology: A Cognitive Perspective on Scientific Language. American Psychologist (44) 500-512.
Attempts to apply Dual Coding Theory (Paivio, 1971) to an issue in the philosophy of science.
Clark, H. (1916). Visual Imagery and Attention: An Analytical Study. American Journal of Psychology (27) 461-492.
Cocking, J.M. (1991). Imagination: A Study in the History of Ideas. London: Routledge.
Cohen, J. (1996). The Imagery Debate: A Critical Assessment. Journal of Philosophical Research (21) 149-182.
Cohen, M.S., Kosslyn, S.M., Breiter, H.C., DiGirolamo, G.J., Thompson, W.L., Anderson, A.K., Bookheimer, S.Y., Rosen, B.R., & Belliveau, J.W. (1996). Changes in Cortical Activity During Mental Rotation: A Mapping Study Using Functional MRI. Brain (119) 89-100.
Conrad, J., Shah, A.H., Divino, C.M., Schluender, S., Gurland, B., Shlasko, E., & Szold, A. (2006). The Role of Mental Rotation and Memory Scanning on the Performance of Laparoscopic Skills. Surgical Endoscopy and Other Interventional Techniques (20) 504-510.
Cooper, L.A. (1975). Mental Rotation of Random Two Dimensional Shapes. Cognitive Psychology (7) 20-43. (Reprinted as chapter 5 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cooper, L.A. (1976). Demonstration of a Mental Analog of an External Rotation. Perception and Psychophysics (19) 296-302 (Reprinted as chap.7 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cooper, L.A. (1995). Varieties of Visual Representation: How Are We to Analyze the Concept of Mental Image? Neuropsychologia (33) 1575-1582.
Reflections on the history of imagery research and findings concerning the neuroscience of imagery. Argues that imagery may not be a unitary cognitive function.
Cooper, L.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1973). Chronometric Studies of the Rotation of Mental Images. In W.G. Chase (Ed.), Visual Information Processing (pp. 75-176).New York: Academic Press. (Reprinted as chapter 4 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cooper, L.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1975). Mental Transformations in the Identification of Left and Right Hands. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (1) 48-56. (Reprinted as chapter 10 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cornoldi, C., Calore, D. & Pra-Baldi, A. (1979) Imagery Ratings and Recall in Congenitally Blind Subjects. Perceptual and Motor Skills (48) 627-639.
Cornoldi, C., Logie, R.H., Brandimonte, M.A., Kaufmann, G., & Reisberg, D. (1996). Stretching the Imagination: Representation and Transformation in Mental Imagery. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Cornoldi, C. & McDaniel, M.A. (Eds.) (1991). Imagery and Cognition. New York: Springer-Verlag.
Coslett, H.B. (1997). Neglect in Vision and Visual Imagery: A Double Dissociation. Brain (120) 1163-1171.
See note at Bisiach & Luzzatti (1978).
Cottingham, J., Stoothofff, R., Murdoch, D., & Kenny, A. (Trans. & Eds.) (1991). The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol.III: The Correspondence. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Craig, E. M. (1973). Role of Mental Imagery in Free Recall of Deaf, Blind and Normal Subjects. Journal of Experimental Psychology (97) 249-253.
Crammond, D.J. (1997). Motor Imagery: Never in Your Wildest Dreams. Trends in Neuroscience (20-2) 54-57.
Cui, X., Jeter, C.B., Yang, D., Montague, P.R., & Eagleman, D.M. (2007). Vividness of Mental Imagery: Individual Variability Can Be Measured Objectively. Vision Research (47) 474-478.
Activity level in early visual cortex (areas 17 & 18) as measured by fMRI during an imagery task was found to correlate positively with people's self reports of imagery vividness (as measured by the VVIQ); also, performance on a color naming task was found to be negatively correlated with VVIQ vividness.
Currie, G. (1995). Visual Imagery as the Simulation of Vision. Mind and Language (10) 25-44.
Currie, G. (2000). Imagination, Delusion and Hallucinations. Mind and Language (15) 168-183.
Currie, G. & Jones N. (2006). McGinn on Delusion and Imagination. Philosophical Books (47) 306-313.
Essay review of McGinn's Mindsight (2004). See McGinn (2006) for reply.
Currie, G. & Ravenscroft, I. (1997). Mental Simulation and Motor Imagery. Philosophy of Science (64) 161-180.
Damasio, A.R. (1994). Descartes' Error: Emotion, Reason, and the Human Brain. New York: Putnam.
Damasio, A.R. (2003). Looking for Spinoza: Joy, Sorrow, and the Feeling Brain. New York: Harcourt.
Damasio, A.R. & Damasio, H. (1996) Making Images and Creating Subjectivity. In R. Llinás & P.S. Churchland (Eds.), The Mind-Brain Continuum: Sensory Processes (pp. 19-27). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Danto, A.C. (1958). Concerning Mental Pictures. Journal of Philosophy (55) 12-20.
Daston, L. (1998). Fear and Loathing of the Imagination in Science. Dædalus (127-1) 73-95.
De Beni, R. & Cornoldi, C. (1988). Imagery Limitations in Totally Congenitally Blind Subjects. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (14) 650-655.
De Beni, R. & Moè, A. (2003). Imagery and rehearsal as study strategies for written or orally presented passages. Psychonomic Bulletin & Review (10) 975-980.
A recent study of the selective interference effect. Cf. Brooks (1967, 1968).
De Volder, A.G., Toyama, H., Kimura, Y., Kiyosawa, M., Nakano, H., Vanlierde, A., Wanet-Defalque, M.-C., Mishina, M., Oda, K., Ishiwata, K., & Senda, M. (2001). Auditory Triggered Mental Imagery of Shape Involves Visual Association Areas in Early Blind Humans. NeuroImage (14) 129-139.
See Lambert et al. (2004) for more on the neuroscience of imagery in the congenitally blind.
Deckert, G.H. (1964). Pursuit Eye Movements in the Absence of a Moving Visual Stimulus. Science (143) 1192-1193.
Della Sala, S., Logie, R.H., Beschin, N., & Denis, M. (2004). Preserved Visuo-Spatial Transformations in Representational Neglect. Neuropsychologia (42) 1358-1364.
Demarais, A.M & Cohen, B.H. (1998). Evidence for Image-Scanning Eye Movements during Transitive Inference. Biological Psychology (49) 229-247.
Eye movements during imagery re-enact those that would be expected during perception of a similar scene. This lends support to the enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Hochberg, 1968; Sarbin & Juhasz, 1970; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). For further evidence for re-enactive perceptual behavior during imagery see: Brandt & Stark (1997), Spivey & Geng (2001), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), Johansson et al. (2005, 2006), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), and Hong et al. (1997).
Dement, W.C. & Kleitman, N. (1957). The Relation of Eye Movements During Sleep to Dream Activity: An Objective Method for the Study of Dreaming. Journal of Experimental Psychology (53) 339-346.
Denis, M. (1991). Image and Cognition. New York: Harvester Wheatsheaf. (Original French, 1989.)
Useful survey.
Denis, M. & Carfantan, M. (1985). People's Knowledge About Images. Cognition (20) 49-60.
An empirical study of the folk psychology of imagery.
Denis, M., Engelkamp, J., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) (1988). Cognitive and Neuropsychological Approaches to Mental Imagery. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff.
Denis, M., Logie, R.H., Cornoldi, C., De Vega, M. & Engelkamp, J. (Eds.) (2001). Imagery, Language, and Visuo-Spatial Thinking. Hove, U.K.: Psychology Press.
Denis, M., Mellet, E., & Kosslyn, S.M. (Eds.) (2004). Neuroimaging of Mental Imagery. Special issue of the European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (vol. 16, No. 5, September 2004).
Dennett, D.C. (1969). Content and Consciousness. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
Argues that the inherent vagueness of images suggests that they are more like descriptions than pictures. (A similar argument is made by Shorter (1952).) Dennett's arguments have been much discussed, but generally rejected (Hannay, 1971; Fodor,1975; Shepard; 1978b; Block,1981a, 1983b; Lyons, 1984; Tye, 1991).
Dennett, D.C. (1978). Brainstorms. Montgomery, VT: Bradford Books.
Chapter 10, “Two Approaches to Mental Images,” is especially relevant .
Dennett, D.C. (1991). Consciousness Explained. Boston, MA: Little, Brown.
Chapter 10 attempts to integrate Kosslyn's quasi-pictorial theory of imagery into Dennett's philosophical framework.
Dennett, D.C. (2002). Does Your Brain Use the Images in It, and If So, How? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 189-190.
Descartes, R. (1637). Optics. (Translated from the French by R. Stoothoff, in J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch (Trans. & Eds.), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol. 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.)
Descartes, R. (1648). Conversation with Burman. (Edited and translated into English by J. Cottingham. Oxford, Oxford University Press, 1976.)
Descartes, R. (1649). The Passions of the Soul. (Translated from the French by R. Stoothoff, in J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch (Trans. & Eds.), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol.1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.)
Descartes, R. (1664). L'Homme (Treatise of Man). (Facsimile of the original French, together with an English translation by T.S. Hall: Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1972. An abridged translation, by R. Stoothoff, is also available in J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch (Trans. & Eds.), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol.1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.)
Descartes' seminal mechanical theory of human physiology, including mechanistic accounts of perception, memory, emotion, and imagination. The work is thought to have been written in or before 1633, but was not published until 1664.
Deschaumes-Molinaro, C., Dittmar, A., & Vernet-Maury, E. (1992). Autonomic Nervous System Response Patterns Correlate with Mental Imagery. Physiology and Behavior (51) 1021-1027.
de’Sperati, C. (2003). Precise Oculomotor Correlates of Visuospatial Mental Rotation and Circular Motion Imagery. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (15) 1244-1259.
Cf. Brandt & Stark (1997), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), and Johansson et al. (2005, 2006).
D'Esposito, M., Detre, J.A., Aguirre, G.K., Stallcup, M., Alsop, D.C., Tippet, L.J., & Farah, M.J. (1997). A Functional MRI Study of Mental Image Generation. Neuropsychologia (35) 725-730.
Finds that visual association cortex, but not primary visual cortex, is activated during visual mental imagery. (See Bartolomeo (2002) and Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for review of the issue.)
Deutsch, M. (1981). Imagery and Inference in Physical Research. In Tweney, R. D., Doherty, M. E., & Mynatt, C. R. (Eds.), On Scientific Thinking (pp. 354-360). New York: Columbia University Press. (Extract from original work of 1959.)
Dilman, I. (1968). Imagination. Analysis (28) 90-97.
DiVesta, F.J., Ingersoll, G., & Sunshine P. (1971). A Factor Analysis of Imagery Tests. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (10) 471-479.
Dix, M. R. (1985). An Inquiry into the Nature of Imagination and its Roles in Cognition. Unpublished Doctoral Dissertation: La Trobe University, Melbourne, Australia.
Doob, L.W. (1964). Eidetic Imagery amongst the Ibo. Ethnology (3) 357-363.
A study of eidetic imagery in a traditional African culture.
Doob, L.W. (1965). Exploring Eidetic Imagery among the Kamba of Central Kenya. Journal of Social Psychology (67) 3-22.
Another study of eidetic imagery in a traditional African culture.
Doob, L.W. (1966). Eidetic Imagery: A Cross-Cultural Will-o’-the-Wisp? Journal of Psychology (63) 13-34.
Doob, L.W. (1972). The Ubiquitous Appearance of Images. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery (pp. 311-332). New York: Academic Press.
A review of work on the cross-cultural study of imagery.
Dror, I.E., Ivey, C., & Rogus, C. (1997). Visual Mental Rotation of Possible and Impossible Objects. Psychonomic Bulletin and Review (4) 242-247.
Dror, I.E., Schmitz-Williams, I.C. & Smith, W. (2005). Older Adults Use Mental Representations That Reduce Cognitive Load: Mental Rotation Utilizes Holistic Representations and Processing. Experimental Aging Research (31) 409-420.
Dunlap, K. (1914). Images and Ideas. Johns Hopkins University Circular (3 – March 1914) 25-41.
A motor theory of imagery. See Washburn (1916) for a related view, and Thomas (1989) for discussion.
Eddy, J.K. & Glass, A.L. (1981). Reading and Listening to High and Low Imagery Sentences. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (20) 333-345.
The selective interference effect in verbal memory.
Edelman, G.M. (1992). Bright Air, Brilliant Fire: On the Matter of Mind. New York: Basic Books.
Ehrlichman, H. & Barrett, J. (1983). Right Hemisphere Specialization for Mental Imagery: A Review of the Evidence. Brain and Cognition (2) 55-76.
Eisenegger, C., Herwig, U., & Jäncke, L. (2007). The Involvement of Primary Motor Cortex in Mental Rotation Revealed by Transcranial Magnetic Stimulation. European Journal of Neuroscience (25) 1240–1244.
Ekstein, M. (2001). Visions of a Compassionate World: Guided Imagery for Spiritual Growth and Social Transformation. Jerusalem: Urim Publications.
Elich, M., Thompson, R. W., & Miller, L. (1985). Mental Imagery as Revealed by Eye Movements and Spoken Predicates: A Test of Neurolinguistic Programming. Journal of Counseling Psychology (32) 622-625.
Neurolinguistic programming theory (now widely discredited) holds that gaze direction during thinking indicates the modality of imagery (visual or auditory) used in the thinking. However, this study found no relation between gaze direction and imagery mode.
Ellis, R.D. (1995). Questioning Consciousness: The Interplay of Imagery, Cognition, and Emotion in the Human Brain. Amsterdam: John Benjamins.
Gives an imagery based theory of thought and semantics. See Thomas (1997b) for discussion.
Emilsson, E.K. (1988). Plotinus on Sense Perception: A Philosophical Study. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Erickson, M.H. & Erickson, E.M. (1938). The Hypnotic Induction of Hallucinatory Color Vision Followed by Pseudo-Negative After-Images. Journal of Experimental Psychology (22) 581-588.
Esrock, E.J. (1994). The Reader's Eye: Visual Imaging as Reader Response. Baltimore, MD. Johns Hopkins University Press.
A historical treatment of the role of the concept of mental (as opposed to verbal) imagery in 20th century literary criticism, and a proposal, drawing on cognitive psychology research, for a mental imagery based theory of response to literature. Cf. Scarry (1999).
Fallgatter, A.J., Mueller, T.J., & Stirk W.K. (1997). Neurophysiological Correlates of Mental Imagery in Different Sensory Modalities. International Journal of Psychophysiology (25) 145-153.
Farah, M.J. (1984). The Neurological Basis of Mental Imagery: A Componential Analysis. Cognition (18) 245-72.
Interprets the then know neurological evidence according to the theory of Kosslyn (1980). See Sergent (1990) for a critique, and Bartolomeo (2002) for a more recent review of the neurology that comes to very diferent conclusions.
Farah, M.J. (1988). Is Visual Imagery Really Visual? Overlooked Evidence from Neuropsychology. Psychological Review (95) 307-317.
Farah, M.J. (1995). Current Issues in the Neuropsychology of Image Generation. Neuropsychologia (33) 1455-1471.
Farah, M. J., Hammond, K. M., Levine, D. N., & Calvanio, R. (1988). Visual and Spatial Mental Imagery: Dissociable Systems of Representation. Cognitive Psychology (20) 439-462.
Farah, M. J., Soso, M. J., & Dasheif, R. M. (1992). Visual Angle of the Mind's Eye Before and After Unilateral Occipital Lobectomy. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (18) 241-246.
Farley, A.M. (1974). VIPS: A Visual Imagery Perception System; the Result of Protocol Analysis. Ph.D. thesis, Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA.
Computer model of imagery based on the enactive theory of Hochberg (1968).
Farley, A.M. (1976). A Computer Implementation of Constructive Visual Imagery and Perception. In R.A. Monty J.W. Senders (Eds.) Eye Movements and Psychological Processes. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
A concise account of the model developed by Farley (1974).
Ferguson, E.S. (1977). The Mind's Eye: Nonverbal Thought in Technology. Science (197) 827-836.
Ferguson, E.S. (1992). Engineering and the Mind's Eye. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
ffytche, D.H., Howard, R.J., Brammer, M.J,. David, A., Woodruff, P., & Williams, S. (1998). The Anatomy of Conscious Vision: An fMRI Study of Visual Hallucinations. Nature Neuroscience (1) 738-742.
Finke, R.A. (1979). The Functional Equivalence of Mental Images and Errors of Movement. Cognitive Psychology (11) 235-264.
Finke, R.A. (1980). Levels of Equivalence in Imagery and Perception. Psychological Review (87) 113-132.
Finke, R.A. (1985). Theories Relating Imagery to Perception. Psychological Bulletin (98) 236-259.
Finke, R.A. (1986). Mental Imagery and the Visual System. Scientific American (245 #iii, March) 76-83.
Finke, R.A. (1989). Principles of Mental Imagery. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Useful textbook of the experimental cognitive psychology of imagery.
Finke, R.A. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1980). Mental Image Acuity in the Preipheral Visual Field. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (6) 126-139.
Finke, R.A. & Kurtzman, H. (1981a). Mapping the Visual Field in Mental Imagery. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (110) 501-517.
Finke, R.A. & Kurtzman, H. (1981b). Area and Contrast Effects upon Perceptual and Imagery Acuity. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (7) 825-832.
Finke, R.A. & Pinker, S. (1983). Directional Scanning of Rembered Visual Patterns. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (9) 398-410.
Finke, R.A., Pinker, S., & Farah, M.J. (1989). Reinterpreting Visual Patterns in Mental Imagery. Cognitive Science (13) 51-78.
Finke, R.A. & Schmidt, M.J. (1977). Orientation-Specific Aftereffects Following Imagination. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (3) 599-606.
A striking finding, but see Broerse & Crassini (1980, 1984), Kunen & May (1980), Harris (1982) and Finke (1989 ch.2).
Finke, R.A. & Schmidt, M.J. (1978). The Quantitative Measure of Pattern Representation in Images Using Orientation Specific Color Aftereffects. Perception and Psychophysics (23) 515-520.
See the annotation to the previous item.
Finke, R.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1986). Visual Functions of Mental Imagery. In K.R. Boff, L. Kaufman, & J.P. Thomas (Eds.), Handbook of Perception and Human Performance, Vol. 2. New York: Wiley-Interscience.
Finke, R.A., Ward, T.B., & Smith, S.M. (1992). Creative Cognition: Theory, Research, and Applications. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Gives imagery a large role in inventive thinking.
Fiorio, M., Tinazzi, M., & Aglioti, S.M. (2006). Selective Impairment of Hand Mental Rotation in Patients with Focal Hand Dystonia. Brain (129) 47-54.
Firth, H. & Oswald, I. (1975). Eye Movements and Visually Active Dreams. Psychophysiology (12) 602-606.
Flanagan, O.J.jr., (1984). The Science of the Mind. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Suggests a “six-code” instead of a Dual Code theory of memory (cf. Kintsch, 1977).
Fleckenstein, K.S., Calendrillo, L.T., & Worley, D.A. (Eds.) (2002). Language and Image in the Reading-Writing Classroom: Teaching Vision. Mahah, NJ: Erlbaum.
Imagery in the elementary school.
Flew, A. (1953). Images, Supposing and Imagining. Philosophy (28) 246-254.
Fodor, J.A. (1975). The Language of Thought. New York: Thomas Crowell. (Paperback edition: Harvard University Press, 1980)
The main thesis of this very influential book is that cognition depends upon an unconscious, language-like representational system innately built into the brain, and which Fodor calls mentalese. However, it also includes a substantial (and also very influential) section on imagery arguing that imagery representations probably have a real role in cognition, but that images (which he takes to be picture-like) cannot be unambiguously meaningful in their own right, and therefore must derive their semantics from mentalese: they function in cognition as “images under descriptions.”
Fontaine, K. (2000). Healing Practices: Alternative Therapies for Nursing. Upper Saddle River, NJ : Prentice Hall.
Includes a section on guided imagery techniques for pain relief.
Fourkas, A.D., Avenanti, A., Urgesi, C., & Aglioti, S.M. (2006). Corticospinal Facilitation During First and Third Person Imagery. Experimental Brain Research (168) 143-151.
Fox Keller, E. & Grontkowski, C.R. (1983). The Mind's Eye. In S. Harding & M.B. Hintikka (Eds.), Discovering Reality: Feminist Perspectives on Epistemology, Metaphysics and Philosophy of Science (pp. 207-24). Dordrecht, Netherlands: Reidel.
A feminist critique of what is seen as the male scientific and philosophical tradition's excessive concentration on the visual aspect of cognition and imagination, at the expense of the other sensory modes, especially touch. (Cf. Newton, 1982).
Frede, D. (1992). The Cognitive Role of Phantasia in Aristotle. In M.C. Nussbaum & A.O. Rorty (Eds.) Essays on Aristotle's De Anima (pp. 279-295). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Frege, G. (1884). Grundlagen der Arithmetik (The Foundations of Arithmetic). (Translated from the German by J.L. Austin, Oxford: Blackwell, 1953.)
Argues, in §§59-60, that the meanings of words, being public and objective, cannot be based upon imagery, which is inherently private, subjective, and idiosyncratic.
Freyd, J.J. (1987). Dynamic Mental Representations. Psychological Review (94) 427-38.
Imagery in motion.
Furbank P.N. (1970). Reflections on the Word ‘Image’. London: Secker & Warburg.
Discusses (very critically) the widespread use of the word ‘imagery’ as a term of art of literary criticism, with a historical account of the origins of the usage that (amongst other things) deals with the relation between the concepts of literary imagery and mental imagery. Furbank's conception of the latter is clearly heavily influenced by Sartre (1940), and, especially, Ryle (1949).
Furlong, E.J. (1953). Abstract Ideas and Images. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (Supplementary volume 27) 121-136.
Furlong, E.J. (1961). Imagination. London: Allen & Unwin.
Gallese, V. & Lakoff, G. (2005). The Brain's Concepts: the Role of the Sensory-motor System in Conceptual Knowledge. Cognitive Neuropsychology (22) 455–479.
Galton, F. (1880). Statistics of Mental Imagery. Mind (5) 301-318. Reprint available online
Pioneering individual differences survey of imagery vividness. Galton claims to have found that many intellectuals, and scientists in particular, have very weak visual imagery, or even lack it altogether. However, a recent study by Brewer & Schommer-Aikins (2006) persuasively refutes this claim.
Galton, F. (1883). Inquiries into Human Faculty and its Development. London: Macmillan.
Includes a summary and discussion of the results of Galton's (1880) pioneering survey of individual differences imagery vividness, as well as a model for general images (of character types) based upon superimposed photographic exposures, and a descriptive account of arithmetical images (“number forms”). However, see Brewer & Schommer-Aikins (2006) for a recent challenge to some of Galton's most influential conclusions.
Ganis, G., Keenan, J.P., Kosslyn, S.M., & Pascual-Leone, A. (2000). Transcranial Magnetic Stimulation of Primary Motor Cortex Affects Mental Rotation. Cerebral Cortex (10) 175-180.
Gardner, H. (1987). The Mind's New Science: A History of the Cognitive Revolution (2nd edition). New York: Basic Books.
Includes a fairly good account of the “analog-propositional” debate.
Gawain, S. (1982). Creative Visualization. New York: Bantam.
Gazzaniga, M.S. (2004). The Cognitive Neurosciences (3rd edn.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Georgopoulos, A.P., Lurito, J.T., Petrides, M., & Schwartz, A.B. (1989). Mental Rotation of the Neuronal Population Vector. Science (243) 234-236.
A neuroscientific study of the mental rotation effect (in monkeys) which links it to motor control.
Giaquinto, M. (1992). Visualizing as a Means of Geometrical Discovery. Mind and Language (7) 382-401.
Giaquinto, M. (1993). Visualizing in Arithmetic. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (53) 385-396.
Gibson, J.J. (1970). On the Relation Between Hallucination and Perception. Leonardo (3) 425-7.
Gibson, J.J. (1974). Visualizing Conceived as Visual Apprehending Without Any Particular Point of Observation. Leonardo (7) 41-42.
Gibson, J.J. (1979). The Ecological Approach to Visual Perception. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin.
Glasgow, J.I. (1993). The Imagery Debate Revisited: A Computational Perspective. Computational Intelligence (9) 310-333.
An array model of imagery similar in spirit to that of Kosslyn and Shwartz (1977). Published together with numerous peer commentaries and author's reply.
Glasgow, J. & Papadias, D. (1992). Computational Imagery. Cognitive Science (16) 355-394.
More about the model proposed by Glasgow (1993).
Goebel, R., Khorram-Sefat, D., Muckli, L., Hacker, H., & Singer, W. (1998). The Constructive Nature of Vision: Direct Evidence from Functional Magnetic Resonance Imaging Studies of Apparent Motion and Motion Imagery. European Journal of Neuroscience (10) 1563–1573.
Goldenberg, G. (1989). The Ability of Patients with Brain Damage to Generate Mental Visual Images. Brain (112) 305-325.
Goldenberg, G. (1993). The Neural Basis of Mental Imagery. Baillière's Clinical Neurology (2) 265-286.
Brain damage in different locations can impair imagery of certain types or aspects of visual objects (e.g., colors, faces, visual forms, letters) whilst leaving it intact for others.
Goldenberg, G. (1998). Is There a Common Substrate for Visual Recognition and Visual Imagery? Neurocase (4) 141-147.
Goldenberg, G., Müllbacher, W., & Nowak, A. (1995). Imagery Without Perception – A Case Study of Anosognosia for Cortical Blindness. Neuropsychologia (33) 1375-1382.
A case of Anton's syndrome (blindness denial) in a patient blinded because of almost complete destruction of V1 (primary visual cortex). There is evidence that this patient had good visual imagery despite most of V1 being absent.
Goldston, D.B., Hinrichs, J.V., & Richman, C.L. (1985) Subjects Expectations, Individual Variability, and the Scanning of Mental Images. Memory and Cognition (13) 365-370.
Goldthwait, C. (1933). Relation of Eye Movements to Visual Imagery. American Journal of Psychology (45) 106-110.
Gray, C.R. & Gummerman, K. (1975). The Enigmatic Eidetic Image: A Critical Examination of Methods, Data, and Theories. Psychological Bulletin (82) 383-407.
Gross, B. R. 1973. Professor Furlong, Imagining and Imaging. Studi Internazionali di Filosofia (5) 199-208.
Grueter, T. (2006). Picture This. Scientific American Mind (17, #1) 18-23.
Grüsser, O.-J. & Landis, T. (1991). Visual Agnosias and Other Disturbances of Visual Perception and Cognition. London: Macmillan.
Does not go into great detail about mental imagery proper, but provides useful reviews of what is known about other types of quasi-perceptual phenomena, such as phosphenes (ch. 10) and afterimages (ch. 23).
Haber, R.N. (1970). Imagine! They are Finally Talking about Images Again. Contemporary Psychology (15) 556-559.
Haber, R.N. (1979). Twenty Years of Haunting Eidetic Imagery: Where's the Ghost? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 583-629.
A major review of research on the elusive phenomenon of eidetic imagery, with appended commentaries.
Halligan, P.W. & Marshall, J.C. (1993). The History and Clinical Presentation of Neglect. In I.H. Robertson & J.C. Marshall (Eds.), Unilateral Neglect: Clinical and Experimental Studies (pp. 3-26). Hove, U.K.: Erlbaum.
Principally a review of the study of unilateral neglect as a perceptual neuropathology, but it also touches on the imaginal aspect of the syndrome.
Hampson, P.J. (1979). The Role of Imagery in Cognition. Ph.D. thesis, University of Lancaster, Lancaster, U.K.
Hampson, P.J. & Duffy, C. (1984). Verbal and Spatial Interference Effects in Congenitally Blind and Sighted Subjects. Canadian Journal of Psychology (38) 411-20.
Selective interference effects (see Brooks (1967, 1968)) demonstrated between spatial perception and spatial imagery in the congenitally blind.
Hampson, P.J., Marks, D.F., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) (1990). Imagery: Current Developments. London: Routledge.
Hampson, P.J. & Morris, P.E. (1978). Unfulfilled Expectations: A Critique of Neisser's Theory of Imagery. Cognition (6) 79-85.
A critique of Neisser's (1976) enactive theory of imagery. See Neisser (1978) for reply.
Hampson, P.J. & Morris, P.E. (1979). Cyclical Processing: A Framework for Imagery Research. Journal of Mental Imagery (3) 11-22.
An attempt to synthesize the quasi-pictorial and enactive theories.
Hannay, A. (1971). Mental Images – A Defence. London: Allen & Unwin.
Argues for the reality of inner pictures (cf. Hannay, 1973); but see Candlish (1975).
Hannay, A. (1973). To See a Mental Image. Mind (82) 161-262.
Harman, G. (1998). Intentionality. In W. Bechtel & G. Graham (Eds.), A Companion to Cognitive Science (pp. 602-610). Oxford: Blackwell.
Includes a discussion of the intentionality of imagery.
Harris, J.P. (1982). The VVIQ and Imagery-Induced McCollough Effects: An Alternative Analysis. Perception and Psychophysics (32) 290-292.
Challenges the results of Finke & Schmidt (1977, 1978).
Harrison, B. (1962-3). Meaning and Mental Images. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (63) 237-250.
Hauck, P.D., Walsh, C.C., & Kroll, N.E.A. (1976). Visual Imagery Mnemonics: Common vs. Bizarre Mental Images. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (7) 160-162.
Hayes, J.R. (1973). On the Function of Visual Imagery in Elementary Mathematics. In W.G. Chase (Ed.) Visual Information Processing. New York: Academic Press.
Hayes-Roth, F. (1979). Distinguishing Theories of Mental Representation: A Critique of Anderson's “Arguments Concerning Mental Imagery”. Psychological Review (86) 376-382.
Hebb, D.O. (1968). Concerning Imagery. Psychological Review (75) 466-477.
Outlines a version of motor or enactive theory.
Hebb, D.O. (1969). The Mind's Eye. Psychology Today (2) 54-57 & 67-68.
Hegarty, M. (1992). Mental Animation: Inferring Motion from Static Displays of Mechanical Systems. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (18) 1084-1102.
Animated mental images.
Heil, J. (1982). What Does the Mind's Eye Look At? Journal of Mind and Behavior (3) 143-149.
An adverbial account of imagery, which may be considered the philosophical counterpart (at the level of language analysis) to the enactive theory in cognitive science. Imagery is regarded not as the having of a mental object (an image) in the mind, rather it is a type of activity, a way of thinking about some actual or possible real-world object. See Rabb (1975), Tye (1984), and Meijsing (2006) for further defenses of adverbial theory.
Heil, J. (1998). Philosophy of Mind. London: Routledge.
Mainly an introductory textbook, but the in the final chapter Heil argues for an imagery based account of intentionality and thought.
Hesslow, G. (2002). Conscious Thought as Simulation of Behavior and Perception. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (6) 242-247.
Suggests that imagery can be thought of as a simulation of vision. Apparently unaware of Currie's (1995; Currie & Ravenscroft, 1997) earlier suggestions to that effect, or the apparatus of simulation theory (e.g. Davies & Stone, 1995) behind them.
Heuer, F., Fischman, D., & Reisberg, D. (1986). Why Does Vivid Imagery Hurt Colour Memory? Canadian Journal of Psychology (40) 161-175.
Individual differences study using the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). A companion piece to Reisberg, Culver, Heuer, & Fischman (1986).
Hilgard, E.R. (1981). Imagery and Imagination in American Psychology, Journal of Mental Imagery (5) 5-66.
Historical reflections, with appended commentaries.
Hinton, G. (1979). Some Demonstrations of the Effects of Structural Descriptions in Mental Imagery. Cognitive Science (3) 231-250.
Argues for the view that images are “structural descriptions”. A version of the “propositional” theory defended by Pylyshyn.
Hobbes, T. (1651). Leviathan. (Edited by C.B. Macpherson, Harmondsworth, U.K.: Penguin, 1968.)
Hobbes outlines his materialist theories of sense perception, imagination and of thought as associative trains of imagery in the early chapters of this work. A little more detail can be found in some of his Latin works that are translated and collected in Calkins (1963).
Hochberg, J. (1968). In the Mind's Eye. In R.N. Haber (Ed.), Contemporary Theory and Research in Visual Perception. Holt Rinehart & Winston. New York. pp. 309-331.
Argues for an enactive approach.
Hochberg, J. (2001). In the Mind’s Eye: Perceptual Coupling and Sensorimotor Contingencies. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (24) 986.
Hochberg, J. & Gellman, L. (1977). The Effect of Landmark Features on Mental Rotation Times. Memory and Cognition (5) 23-26.
Hochman, J. (1994). Ahsen's Image Psychology. Journal of Mental Imagery (18) 1-118.
Hollard, V.D. & Delius, J.D. (1982). Rotational Invariance in Visual Pattern Recognition by Pigeons and Humans. Science (218) 804-806.
Pigeons do not seem to do mental rotation like humans do.
Holt, R.R. (1964). Imagery: The Return of the Ostracised. American Psychologist (19) 254-266.
Influential account of the historical vicissitudes of the concept of imagery in scientific psychology.
Hong, C.C.-H., Potkin, S.G., Antrobus, J.S., Dow, B.M., Callaghan, G.M., & Gillin, J.C. (1997). REM Sleep Eye Movement Counts Correlate with Visual Imagery in Dreaming: A Pilot Study. Psychophysiology (34) 377-381.
Support for an enactive account of imagery. Cf. Brandt & Stark (1997), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), and Johansson et al. (2005, 2006).
Hopkins, R. (2006). With Sight Too Much in Mind, Mind Too Little in Sight? Philosophical Books (47) 293-305.
Essay review of McGinn's Mindsight (2004). See McGinn (2006) for reply.
Hopkins, W.D., Fagot, J., & Vauclair, J. (1993). Mirror-Image Matching and Mental Rotation Problem Solving by Baboons (Papio Papio): Unilateral Input Enhances Performance. Journal of Experimental Psycholgy: General (122) 61-72.
Baboons do not seem to do mental rotation like humans do.
Horne, P.V. (1993). The Nature of Imagery. Consciousness and Cognition (2) 58-82.
Suggests that imagery arises when stored visual information is fed through the visual information processing system of the brain once again. The suggestion would appear to be consistent with the quasi-pictorial theory of Kosslyn, but provides much less detail. Printed together with several commentaries.
Horowitz, M.J. (1970). Image Formation and Cognition. New York: Appelton.
Largely concerned with the clinical relevance of imagery.
Horowitz, M.J. (1983). Image Formation and Psychotherapy. New York: Aronson.
This is essentially a revised edition, somewhat more appropriately titled, of Horowitz (1970).
Horton, W.S., & Rapp, D.M. (2003). Out of Sight, out of Mind: Occlusion and the Accessibility of Information in Narrative Comprehension. Psychonomic Bulletin & Review (10) 104-110.
Evidence that, in listening to stories, people visualize the scene from the perspective of the protagonist. Subjects remembered objects mentioned in the story more quickly, if they would have been visible from the protagonist's viewpoint.
Howard, R.J., ffytche, D.H., Barnes, J., McKeefry, D., Ha, Y., Woodruff, P.W., Bullmore, E.T., Simmons, A., Williams, S.C.R., David, A.S., & Brammer, M. (1998). The Functional Anatomy of Imagining and Perceiving Colour. NeuroReport (9) 1019–1023.
Color imagery (by contrast with color perception) did not result in increased neural activity in retinotopically mapped brain areas (V1 and V4), but, rather, in "higher" centers.
Hume, D. (1740). A Treatise of Human Nature. (2nd Oxford edition, edited by L.A. Selby-Bigge & P.H. Nidditch. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1978.)
Hume's ubiquitous ideas are, to all intents, mental images (but see Yolton (1996) for an alternative view).
Hume, D. (1748). An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. (Edition of E. Steinberg. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 1977.)
Hume's ubiquitous ideas are, to all intents, mental images (but see Yolton (1996) for an alternative view).
Humphrey, G. (1951). Thinking. London: Methuen.
Contains what is probably still the best account in English of the views of the influential imageless thought school of German introspective psychology, including translations from primary sources.
Hurovitz, C., Dunn, S., Domhoff, G. W., & Fiss, H. (1999). The Dreams of Blind Men and Women: a Replication and Extension of Previous Findings. Dreaming (9) 183-193. Reprint available online
Study finds that people blind since birth or early childhood do not have visual imagery in their dreams, but have an abundance of imagery of other sensory modes.
Ingle, D. (2002). Problems with a “Cortical Screen” for Visual Imagery. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 196-196.
Intons-Peterson, M.J. (1983). Imagery Paradigms: How Vulnerable are They to Experimenter's Expectations? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (9) 394-412.
A clear demonstration of the effects of demand characteristics on imagery experiments. Experimental results can be seriously distorted by even very subtle cues as to the experimenters' expectations.
Intons-Peterson, M.J. & Roskos-Ewoldsen, B.B. (1989). Sensory Perceptual Qualities of Images. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (15) 188-199.
Ishai, A. & Sagi, D. (1995). Common Mechanisms of Visual Imagery and Perception. Science (268) 1772-1774.
Ishai, A. & Sagi, D. (1997). Visual Imagery: Effects of Short- and Long-Term Memory. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (9) 734-742.
Ishai, A. & Sagi, D. (1998). Visual Imagery and Visual Perception: The Role of Memory and Conscious Awareness. In S.R. Hameroff, A.W. Kaszniak & A.W. Scott (Eds.), Toward a Science of Consciousness II: The Second Tucson Discussions and Debates (pp. 321-328). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Ishiguro, H. (1966). Imagination. In B.A.O. Williams & A. Montefiore (Eds.), British Analytical Philosophy (pp. 153-178). London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
Principally a discussion of Ryle's (1949) views. Not to be confused with Ishiguro (1967) where she presents her own original theory.
Ishiguro, H. (1967). Imagination. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume (41) 37-56.
Images as intentional objects (in the sense of Anscombe 1965). Strongly influenced by Wittgenstein and Ryle.
Jacobs, L., Feldman, M., & Bender, M.B. (1972). Are the Eye Movements of Dreaming Sleep Related to the Visual Images of the Dreams? Psychophysiology (9) 393-401.
Jacobson, E. (1932). Electrophysiology of Mental Activities. American Journal of Psychology (44) 677-694.
Evidence for stimulus-appropriate activity in the eye muscles during imagery.
Jaensch, E.R. (1930). Eidetic Imagery and Typological Methods of Investigation. (Translated from the German by O.A. Oeser.) London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
A seminal study of eidetic imagery, but seriously tainted by the racist assumptions of its Nazi milieu.
James, W. (1890). The Principles of Psychology. New York: Holt. Harvard University Press edition of 1983.
Janssen, W.H. (1976a). Selective Interference in Paired-Associate and Free Recall Learning: Messing up the Image. Acta Psychologia (40) 35-48.
Janssen, W. (1976b). On the Nature of Mental Imagery. Soesterburg, Netherlands: Institute for Perception TNO.
Jastrow, J. (1899). The Mind's Eye. Appleton's Popular Science Monthly (54) 299-312.
The mind's eye and seeing-as (cf. Thomas, 1997a). This is also the paper that first introduced the duck-rabbit figure to philosophers (notably Wittgenstein) and psychologists (although Jastrow acknowledges that he did not originate it).
Jay, M. (1993). Downcast Eyes: The Denigration of Vision in Twentieth-Century French Thought. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
Jeannerod, M. (1994). The Representing Brain: Neural Correlates of Motor Intention and Imagery. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (17) 187-245. Preprint available online
Jeannerod, M. (1995). Mental Imagery in the Motor Context. Neuropsychologia (33) 1419-1432.
Johansson, R., Holsanova, J., & Holmqvist, K. (2005). What Do Eye Movements Reveal About Mental Imagery? Evidence From Visual and Verbal Elicitations. In B.G. Bara, L. Barsalou, & M. Bucciarelli (Eds.), Proceedings of the 27th Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 1054-1059). Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum. Preprint available online in PDF
See next comment, on Johansson et al. (2006).
Johansson, R., Holsanova, J., & Holmqvist, K. (2006). Pictures and Spoken Descriptions Elicit Similar Eye Movements During Mental Imagery, Both in Light and in Complete Darkness. Cognitive Science (30) 1053-1079. Reprint available online in PDF
Direct support for the enactive theory of imagery (Thomas, 1999b). For further related evidence, see Brandt & Stark (1997), and Laeng & Teodorescu (2002) (and the further references in the accompanying comments).
Johnson, M. (1987). The Body in the Mind: The Bodily Basis of Meaning, Imagination and Reason. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Cognitive metaphor theory and the concept of image schema. See also Lakoff & Johnson (1980, 1999).
Jolicoeur, P. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1985). Demand Characteristics in Image Scanning Experiments. Journal of Mental Imagery (9) 41-50.
Jones, G.V. (1986). Lexical Imagery and Semantics. In D.G. Russell, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.) Imagery 2 (pp. 67-71). Dunedin, New Zealand: Human Performance Associates.
Argues that it is differences in the predicability rather than in the imagery value (Paivio, 1971; Paivio, Yuille & Madigan, 1968) of words that accounts for their differential memorability.
Jonides, J., Kahn, R., & Rozin, P. (1975). Imagery Instructions Improve Memory in Blind Subjects. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (5) 424-6.
Instructions to use imagery mnemonics (that had been assumed to work in sighted subjects by inducing them to form visual imagery) seem to just as effective in improving memory performance when they are given to congenitally blind subjects (cf. Zimler & Keenan, 1983; and see also: Marmor & Zaback, 1976; Carpenter & Eisenberg, 1978; Kerr, 1983).
Juhasz, J.B. (1969). Imagining, Imitation and Role Taking. Doctoral Thesis. University of California Berkeley.
Juhasz, J.B. (1971). Greek Theories of Imagination. Journal of the History of the Behavioral Sciences (7) 39-58.
Juhasz, J.B. (1972). An Experimental Study of Imagining. Journal of Personality (40) 588-600.
Derives support for a version of enactive theory (Sarbin & Juhasz, 1970; Sarbin, 1972) from a study of individual differences.
Julstrom, B. A., & Baron, R. J. (1985). A Model of Mental Imagery. International Journal of Man-Machine Studies (23) 313-334.
A connectionist implementation of a quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Just, M.A. & Carpenter, P.A. (1976). Eye Fixations and Cognitive Processes. Cognitive Psychology (8) 441-480.
A study of the Shepard & Metzler (1971) mental rotation task. See also Carpenter & Just (1976).
Just, M.A., Newman, S.D., Keller, T.A., McEleney, A., & Carpenter, P.A. (2004). Imagery in sentence comprehension: an fMRI study. NeuroImage (21) 112- 124.
Kan, I.P., Barsalou, L.W., Solomon, K.O., Minor, J.K., & Thompson-Schill, S.L. (2003). Role of Mental Imagery in a Property Verification Task: fMRI Evidence for Perceptual Representations of Conceptual Knowledge. Cognitive Neuropsychology (20) 525-540.
Experimental and neuroimaging evidence that conceptual knowledge is encoded in the form of perceptual representations (Barsalou, 1999) or imagery, rather than as “amodal” mentalese representations.
Kant, I. (1781/1787). Critique of Pure Reason. (Edited and translated from the 1st and 2nd German editions by N.K. Smith, London: Macmillan, 2nd edn. 1933.)
Kasem, A. (1989). Can Berkeley Be Called an Imagist? Indian Philosophical Quarterly (6 ) 75-88.
Kaski, D. (2002). Revision: Is Visual Perception a Requisite for Visual Imagery? Perception (31) 717-731.
Review article considering whether, or to what degree, the neural structures that subserve visual imagery are the same as those that subserve visual perception.
Kaufmann, G. (1980). Imagery, Language and Cognition. Oslo, Norway: Universitetsforlaget.
Psychological study of imagery in problem solving. Suggests that the intentionality of mental imagery derives from that of natural language.
Kearney, R. (1988). The Wake of Imagination: Ideas of Creativity in Western Culture. London: Hutchinson.
Keilkopf, C.F. (1968). The Pictures in the Head of a Man Born Blind. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (28) 501-513.
Keenan, J.M. (1983). Qualifications and Clarifications of Images of Concealed Objects: A Reply to Kerr and Neisser. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (9) 222-230.
Defends the work of Keenan & Moore (1979) against the criticism of Kerr & Neisser (1983).
Keenan, J.M. & Moore, R.E. (1979). Memory of Concealed Objects: A Reexamination of Neisser and Kerr. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Learning and Memory (5) 374-385.
Fails to replicate, and rejects, the results of Neisser & Kerr (1973). However, Kerr & Neisser (1983) were able to replicate their original results and suggest an explanation as to why Keenan & Moore failed to do so (but see Keenan, 1983).
Kerr, N.H. (1983). The Role of Vision in “Visual Imagery” Experiments: Evidence from the Congenitally Blind. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (112) 265-77.
Many “classic” experimental effects attributed to imagery can be reproduced in blind subjects.
Kerr, N.H. (1987). Locational Representation in Mental Imagery: The Third Dimension. Memory and Cognition (15) 521-530.
Kerr, N. (1993). Mental Imagery, Dreams, and Perception. In D. Foulkes & C. Cavallero (Eds.), Dreaming as Cognition (pp. 18-37). New York: Harvester-Wheatsheaf.
Kerr, N.H. (2000) Dreaming, Imagery and Perception. In M.H. Kryger, T. Roth, & W.C. Dement (Eds.), Principles and Practice of Sleep Medicine (3rd edn.) (pp. 482-490). Philadelphia: Saunders.
Kerr, N.H. & Domhoff, G.W. (2004). Do the Blind Literally “See” in Their Dreams? A Critique of a Recent Claim That They Do. Dreaming (14) 230-233. Preprint available online
Kerr, N.H., Foulkes, D., & Schmidt, M. (1982). The Structure of Laboratory Dream Reports in Blind and Sighted Subjects. Journal of Nervous and Mental Disease (170) 286-294.
Kerr, N.H. & Neisser, U. (1983). Mental Images of Concealed Objects: New Evidence. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (9) 212-221.
A replication of Neisser & Kerr (1973), and a response to Keenan & Moore (1979). See also Keenan (1983).
Kessel, F.S. (1972). Imagery: A Dimension of Mind Rediscovered. British Journal of Psychology (63) 149-62.
Kieras, D. (1978). Beyond Pictures and Words: Alternative Information-processing Models for Imagery Effects in Verbal Memory. Psychological Bulletin (85) 532-554.
Argues that something like Dual Coding Theory may still be correct even though imagery may ultimately be reducible to “propositional” (mentalese) descriptions.
Kind, A. (2001). Putting the Image back in Imagination. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (62) 85-109.
Argues (against the claims of certain 20th century analytical philosophers) that there is a conceptual connection between imagery and creative imagination. Cf. Thomas (1997a).
Kintsch, W. (1977). Memory and Cognition. New York: Wiley.
Cf. Flanagan (1984).
Klatzky, R.L., Lederman, S.J., & Matula D.E. (1991).Imagined Haptic Exploration in Judgements of Object Properties. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (17) 314-322.
A rare study of haptic imagery .
Knauff, M. & May, E. (2006). Mental Imagery, Reasoning, and Blindness. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology: Section A: Human Experimental Psychology (59) 161-177. Preprint available online
Kohler, C., Hoffmann, K.P., Dehnhardt, G., & Mauck,B. (2005). Mental Rotation and Rotational Invariance in the Rhesus Monkey (Macaca mulatta). Brain, Behavior and Evolution (66) 158-166.
Kolers, P.A. (1987). Imaging. In R.L. Gregory & O.L. Zangwill (Eds.), The Oxford Companion to the Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kolers, P.A. & Smythe, W.E. (1979). Images, Symbols, and Skills. Canadian Journal of Psychology (33) 158-184.
Koshino, H., Carpenter, P.A., Keller, T.A., & Just, M.A. (2005). Interactions Between the Dorsal and the Ventral Pathways in Mental Rotation: An fMRI Study. Cognitive Affective & Behavioral Neuroscience (5) 54-66.
Multiple brain regions are involved in mental rotation.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1973). Scanning Visual Images: Some Structural Implications. Perception and Psychophysics (14) 90-94.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1975). Information Representation in Visual Images. Cognitive Psychology (7) 341-370.
As well as describing an experiment demonstrating that imagery mental representations are functionally distinct from verbal ones, this also contains the first published statement of Kosslyn's CRT (Cathode Ray Tube) display theory of imagery, based on the analogy with computer graphics programs, which evolved into his quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1976a). Can Imagery be Distinguished from Other Forms of Internal Representation? Evidence from Studies of Information Retrieval Times. Memory and Cognition (4) 291-297.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1976b). Using Imagery to Retrieve Semantic Information: a Developmental Study. Child Development (47) 434-444.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1978a). Measuring the Visual Angle of the Mind's Eye. Cognitive Psychology (10) 356-389.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1978b). Imagery and Internal Representation. In E. Rosch & B.B. Lloyd (Eds.), Cognition and Categorization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1980). Image and Mind. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Detailed and seminal statement and defense of the computational version of quasi-pictorial theory of imagery, which has been extremely influential. See Kosslyn (1981) and Kosslyn, Pinker, Smith, & Shwartz (1979) for more concise accounts.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1981). The Medium and the Message in Mental Imagery: A Theory. Psychological Review (88) 46-66.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1983). Ghosts in the Mind's Machine: Creating and Using Images in the Brain. New York: Norton.
A popularization of the quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1987). Seeing and Imagining in the Cerebral Hemispheres: A Computational Approach. Psychological Review (94) 148-75.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1994). Image and Brain: The Resolution of the Imagery Debate. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Updates the quasi-pictorial theory with an account of how imagery may be neurologically embodied. For a more concise (and more recent) account see Kosslyn (2005).
Kosslyn, S.M. (2005). Mental Images and the Brain. Cognitive Neuropsychology (22) 333-347.
A recent re-statement of quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M., Alpert, N. M., Thompson, W. L., Maljkovic, V., Weise, S. B., Chabris, C. F., Hamilton, S. E., Rauch, S. L., & Buonanno, F. S. (1993). Visual mental imagery activates topographically organized visual cortex: PET investigations. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (5) 263-287.
See annotation to Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Ball, T.M., & Reiser, B.J. (1978). Visual Images Preserve Metric Spatial Information: Evidence from Studies of Image Scanning. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (4) 47-60.
Extensive and well known study of the mental scanning phenomenon.
Kosslyn, S.M., Behrmann, M., & Jeannerod, M. (Eds.) (1995). The Cognitive Neuroscience of Mental Imagery. Neuropsychologia special issue (33, #11).
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G., & Thompson, W.L., (2001). Neural Foundations of Imagery. Nature Reviews: Neuroscience (2) 635-642.
Claims that imagery depends on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain. For contradictory evidence see, e.g., Roland & Gulyàs (1994), Mellet et al. (1996), D'Espositoet al. (1997), Bartolomeo et al. (1997), Bartolomeo et al. (1998), Howard et al. (1998), Goebel et al. (1998). For an attempted reconciliation of the contradictions see Kosslyn & Thompson (2003). Note also that Thomas (1999b), Abell & Currie (1999), and Pylyshyn (2002a, 2002b, 2003a, 2003b) all independently argue that even if it is true that the retinotopically mapped areas are always activated during imagery, it does not necessarily follow that these activation patterns are the mental images.
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G. & Thompson, W.L. (2003). Mental imagery: Against the Nihilistic Hypothesis. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7, #3) 109-111.
A response to Pylyshyn (2003a). Pylyshyn (2003c) responds to this.
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G., & Thompson, W.L. (2004). Mental Imagery: Depictive Accounts. In R. L. Gregory (Ed.), The Oxford Companion to the Mind (2nd edn.). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Hatfield, G. (1984). Representation Without Symbol Systems. Social Research (51) 1019-1045.
Kosslyn, S.M., Holyoak, K.J., & Huffman, C.S. (1976). A Processing Approach to the Dual Coding Hypothesis. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Learning and Memory (2) 223-233.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Koenig, O. (1992). Wet Mind: The New Cognitive Neuroscience. New York: The Free Press.
Kosslyn, S.M., Murphy, G.L., Bemesderfer, M.E. & Feinstein, K.J. (1977). Category and Continuum in Mental Comparisons. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (106) 341-375.
Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1975b, 1978a, 1978b).
Kosslyn, S.M., Pascual-Leone, A., Felician, O., Camposana, S., Keenan, J.P., Thompson, W.L., Ganis, G., Sukel, K.E. & Alpert, N.M. (1999). The Role of Area 17 in Visual Imagery: Convergent Evidence from PET and rTMS. Science (284) 167-170.
See annotation to Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Pinker, S., Smith, G.E., & Shwartz, S.P. (1979). On the Demystification of Mental Imagery. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2) 535-581.
A defense of the quasi-pictorial theory of imagery, with commentaries and reply.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Pomerantz, J.R. (1977). Imagery, Propositions and the Form of Internal Representations. Cognitive Psychology (9) 52-76.
A defence of quasi-pictorial theory against Pylyshyn's (1973) criticisms, and a critique of the alternative propositional (description) theory.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Shwartz, S.P. (1977). A Simulation of Visual Imagery. Cognitive Science (1) 265-295.
Computer model of the quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Shwartz, S.P. (1978). Visual Images as Spatial Representations in Active Memory. In A.R. Hanson & E.M. Riseman (Eds.), Computer Vision Systems. New York: Academic Press.
Another description of their computer model of the quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M., Sukel, K.E., & Bly, B.M. (1999). Squinting with the Mind's Eye: Effects of Stimulus Resolution on Imaginal and Perceptual Comparisons. Memory and Cognition (19) 276-282.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Thompson, W.L. (2003). When is Early Visual Cortex Activated During Visual Imagery? Psychological Bulletin (129) 723-746.
Attempts to reconcile conflicting findings as to whether retinotopically mapped areas of visual cortex, especially V1, are activated during visual imagery. For a different perspective from neurology, see Bartolomeo (2002).
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., & Ganis, G. (2002). Mental Imagery Doesn’t Work like That. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 198-200.
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., & Ganis, G. (2006). The Case for Mental Imagery. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., Kim, I.J., & Alpert, N.M. (1995). Topographical Representation of Mental Images in Primary Visual Cortex. Nature (378) 496-498.
See annotation to Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson. W.L., Sukel, K.E., & Alpert, N.M. (2005). Two Types of Image Generation: Evidence from PET. Cognitive Affective & Behavioral Neuroscience (5) 41-53.
Subtly different patterns of brain activation are found according to whether images are formed entirely on the basis of verbal descriptions, or after viewing pictures of parts that will then be mentally assembled into a full image. It is claimed that this result is inconsistent with the enactive (perceptual activity) theory of imagery. (However, that claim seems to be based on a misunderstanding of enactive theory.)
Koulack, D. (1972). Rapid Eye Movements and Visual Imagery During Sleep. Psychological Bulletin (78) 155-158.
Review article.
Kozhevnikov, M., Hegarty, M., & Mayer R.E. (2002). Revising the Visualizer-Verbalizer Dimension: Evidence for Two Types of Visualizers. Cognition and Instruction (20) 47-77.
Kreiman, G., Koch C., & Freid, G. (2000). Imagery Neurons in the Human Brain. Nature (408) 357-361.
Kunen, S. & May, J.G. (1980). Spatial Frequency Content of Visual Imagery. Perception and Psychophysics (28) 555-559.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1982). Mental Images, Appreciation of Grammatical Patterns, and Creativity. Journal of Mental Imagery (6) 183-202.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1990). Mind-Brain Identity Theory: A Materialistic Foundation for the Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery. In R.G. Kunzendorf & A.A. Sheikh (Eds.), The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application (pp. 9-36). Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1991a). The Causal Efficacy of Consciousness in General, Imagery in Particular: A Materialistic Perspective. In R.G. Kunzendorf (ed.) Mental Imagery (pp. 147-157). New York: Plenum Press.
R.G. Kunzendorf (Ed.) (1991b). Mental Imagery. (Proceedings of the 11th Conference of the American Association for the Study of Mental Imagery, Washington, D.C., 1989). New York: Plenum Press.
Kunzendorf, R.G., Justice, M., & Capone, D. (1997). Conscious Images as “Centrally Excited Sensations”: A Developmental Study of Imaginal Influences on the ERG. Journal of Mental Imagery (21) 155-166.
Kunzendorf, R.G. & Sheikh, A.A. (Eds.) (1990). The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application. Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Kwekkeboom, K.L. (2000). Measuring Imaging Ability: Psychometric Testing of the Imaging Ability Questionnaire. Research in Nursing & Health (23) 301-309.
Laeng, B. & Teodorescu, D.-S. (2002). Eye Scanpaths During Visual Imagery Reenact those of Perception of the Same Visual Scene. Cognitive Science (26) 207-231. Reprint available online
Replicates and extends the findings of Brandt & Stark (1997), providing direct experimental support for the enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). Similar evidence comes from Johansson et al. (2005, 2006), Demarais & Cohen (1998), Spivey & Geng (2001), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), and Hong et al. (1997).
Lakoff, G. & Johnson, M. (1999). Philosophy in the Flesh. New York: Basic Books.
Cognitive metaphor theory and image schemata. See also Lakoff & Johnson (1980) and Johnson (1987).
Lambert, S., Sampaio, E., Mauss, Y., & Scheiber, C. (2004). Blindness and Brain Plasticity: Contribution of Mental Imagery? An fMRI Study. Cognitive Brain Research (20) 1-11.
Imagery in congenitally blind subjects (presumably haptic/tactile imagery) is accompanied by activation of the primary visual area of the brain (V1). See De Volder et al. (2001) for more on the neuroscience of imagery in the congenitally blind.
Lang, P.J. (1979). A Bio-Informational Theory of Emotional Imagery. Psychophysiology (16) 495-512.
A version of the description or “propositional” theory of imagery .
Lawrie, R. (1970). The Existence of Mental Images. Philosophical Quarterly (20) 253-7.
Lee, L.H. & Olness, K.N. (1996). Effects of Self-induced Mental Imagery on Autonomic Reactivity in Children. Journal of Developmental and Behavioral Pediatrics (17) 323-327.
Levin, S.L., Mohamed, F.B., & Platek, S.M. (2005). Common Ground for Spatial Cognition? A Behavioral and fMRI Study of Sex Differences in Mental Rotation and Spatial Working Memory. Evolutionary Psychology (3) 227-254. Online serial, URL: http://human-nature.com/ep/articles/ep03227254.html
Levine, D. N., Warach, J., & Farah, M. (1985). Two Visual Systems in Mental Imagery: Dissociation of “What” and “Where” in Imagery Disorder Due to Bilateral Posterior Cerebral Lesions. Neurology (35) 1010-1018.
Ley, R.G. (1983). Cerebral Laterality and Imagery. In A.A. Sheikh (Ed.), Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application (pp.252-287). New York: Wiley.
Argues for the now outdated view that imagery is primarily a right cerebral hemisphere function. For more modern accounts of cerebral laterality in relation to imagery see Michimata (1997), Farah (1995), Loverock & Modigliani (1995), Trojano & Grossi (1994), Tippett (1992), or Ehrlichman & Barrett (1983).
Locke, J. (1700). An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Edition of S. Pringle-Pattison (1924). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
It is controversial whether (or to what extent) Locke understood the ideas, that play so large a role in his epistemology, to be mental images. See, e.g., Price (1953), Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996), Ayers (1986, 1991), White, (1990), Chappell (1994), Lowe (1995, 2005).
Lockhart, R.S. (1987). Code Dueling. Canadian Journal of Psychology (41) 387-389.
Review of Paivio (1986).
Logie, R.H. & Baddeley, A.D. (1990). Imagery and Working Memory. In P.J. Hampson, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.) Imagery: Current Developments (pp. 103-128). London: Routledge.
Logie, R.H. & Denis, M. (Eds.) (1991). Mental Images in Human Cognition. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science Publishers B.V.
Lopes da Silva, F.H. (2003). Visual dreams in the congenitally blind? Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7) 328-330.
See Kerr & Domhoff (2004) for a skeptical rejoinder.
Loverock, D.S. & Modigliani, V. (1995). Visual Imagery and the Brain: A Review. Journal of Mental Imagery (19) 91-132.
Lowe, E.J. (1995). Locke on Human Understanding. London: Routledge.
Includes a defense of Locke's theory that our understanding of linguistic meaning is grounded in our ideas. Locke's ideas can be (but perhaps need not be) interpreted as being mental pictures. Also argues (though more tentatively than Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996) or Chappell (1994)) that the ideas of Locke should not be understood to be mental images (see also Lowe (1995)). By contrast, Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), and Price (1953) argue that Locke's ideas are images.
Lowe, E.J. (1996). Subjects of Experience. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Contains a sophisticated philosophical defense of the Lockean view that the meanings of linguistic utterances are rooted in imagery. Cf. Ellis (1995), Thomas (1997b).
Lowe, E.J. (2005). Locke. London: Routledge.
Argues (though more tentatively than Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996) or Chappell (1994)) that the ideas of Locke should not be understood to be mental images (see also Lowe (1995)). For the opposing view see Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), or Price (1953).
Luria, A.R. (1960). Memory and the Structure of Mental Processes. Problems of Psychology (4) 81-94.
Luria's first published account in English of his studies of the remarkable mnemonic and imagery abilities of Shereshevskii. However,the findings became well known only with the publication of Luria's (1968) book.
Luria, A.R. (1968). The Mind of a Mnemonist. (Translated from the Russian by L. Solotaroff.) New York: Basic Books.
Seminal case study of a “hyper-imager”.
Luzzatti, C., Vecchi, T., Agazzi, D., Cesa-Bianchi, M., & Vergani, C. (1998). A Neurological Dissociation Between Preserved Visual and Impaired Spatial Processing in Mental Imagery. Cortex (34) 461-469. Available online from the Cortex archive
Lycos, K. (1964). Plato and Aristotle on ‘Appearing’. Mind (73) 496-514.
Lyons, W. (1984). The Tiger and His Stripes. Analysis (44) 93-93.
Maguire, E.A., Valentine, E.R., Wilding, J.M., & Kapur, N. (2003). Routes to Remembering: The Brains behind Superior Memory. Nature Neuroscience (6) 90-95.
Contemporary champion competitive memorizers do not derive their abilities from having abnormal brains, but, rather, have developed their skills in using imagery mnemonic techniques, particularly the method of loci (Yates, 1966; Ross & Lawrence, 1968).
Malcolm, N. (1970). Memory and Representation. Noûs (4) 59-70.
Argues against the need for images (or, indeed, any type of representation) to explain memory.
Mangan B (2001) Sensation's Ghost: The Non-Sensory “Fringe” of Consciousness. Psyche (7). (Online serial). Available online
Argues that, besides imagery, there are non-imaginal conscious contents (cf. Ellis, 1995).
Marks, D.F. (1972). Individual Differences in the Vividness of Visual Imagery and their Effects. In P. W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery (pp. 83-108). New York: Academic Press.
Marks, D.F. (1973). Visual Imagery Differences in the Recall of Pictures. British Journal of Psychology (64) 17-24.
Introduces the VVIQ questionnaire, used for measuring individual differences in imagery vividness. Results suggest that vivid imagers remember pictures better. The VVIQ is available online.
Marks, D.F. (1983). Mental Imagery and Consciousness: A Theoretical Review. In A.A. Sheikh (Ed.) Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application. New York: Wiley.
Marks, D.F. (Ed.) (1986). Theories of Image Formation. New York: Brandon House.
Marks, D.F. (1997). Paivio, Allan Urho. In N. Sheehy, A. J. Chapman, & W.A. Conroy (Eds.), Biographical Dictionary of Psychology (pp. 432-434). New York: Routledge.
Marks, D.F. (1999). Consciousness, Mental Imagery and Action. British Journal of Psychology (90) 567-585.
Reviews work on individual differences in imagery vividness, and relates it to the psychology of action.
Marmor, G.S. & Zaback, L.A. (1976). Mental Rotation by the Blind: Does Mental Rotation Depend on Visual Imagery? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (2) 515-521.
Mental rotation effect (Shepard & Cooper, 1982) demonstrated in congenitally blind subjects using tactile stimuli (cf. Carpenter & Eisenberg, 1978; and see also Jonides, Kahn, & Rozin, 1975; Kerr, 1983; Zimler & Keenan, 1983).
Marschark, M. & Hunt, R.R. (1989) A Reexamination of the Role of Imagery in Learning and Memory. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (15) 710-720.
A version of Dual Coding Theory, but instead of imagery and verbal representations being stored as such in long term memory (as Paivio holds), they are here seen as constructed on the fly during recall from long term memories stored in the form of a more fundamental mentalese (“propositional”) code.
Marschark, M., Richman, C.L., Yuille J.C., & Hunt R.R. (1987). The Role of Imagery in Memory: On Shared and Distinctive Information. Psychological Bulletin (102) 28-41.
A version of Dual Coding Theory, but with the codes emergent from a more fundamental mentalese (“propositional”) code.
Mast, F.W. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2002a). Visual Mental Images Can Be Ambiguous: Insights from Individual Differences in Spatial Transformation Abilities. Cognition (86) 57-70.
Mast, F.W. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2002b). Eye Movements During Visual Mental Imagery. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (6) 271-272. Reprint available online
Matthews, G.B. (1969). Mental Copies. Philosophical Review (78) 53-73.
Mazard, A., Tzourio-Mazoyer, N., Crivello, F., Mazoyer, B., & Mellet, E. (2004). A PET Meta-analysis of Object and Spatial Mental Imagery. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (16) 673-695.
McDaniel, M.A. & Pressley, M.(Eds) (1987). Imagery and Related Mnemonic Processes: Theories, Individual Differences, and Applications. New York: Springer-Verlag.
McGinn, C. (2004). Mindsight: Image, Dream, Meaning. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
For critical reviews see Hopkins (2006), Currie & Jones (2006), and Sosa (2006).
McGinn, C. (2006). Images Recollected. Philosophical Books (47) 326-333.
A reply to Hopkins (2006), Currie & Jones (2006), and Sosa (2006).
McKellar, P. (1957). Imagination and Thinking. London: Cohen & West.
McKim, R.H. (1972). Experiences in Visual Thinking. Monterey, CA: Brooks/Cole.
Aims to help readers improve their abilities as visual (image) thinkers.
McMahon, C.E. (1973). Images as Motives and Motivators: A Historical Perspective. American Journal of Psychology (86) 465-90.
Meador, K.J., Loring, D.W., Bowers, D., & Heilman, K.M. (1987). Remote Memory and Neglect Syndrome. Neurology (37) 522-526.
Representational (imaginal) neglect can be ameliorated by turning the head leftward.
Mechelli, A., Price, C.J., Friston, K.J., & Ishai, A. (2004). Where Bottom-up Meets Top-down: Neuronal Interactions during Perception and Imagery. Cerebral Cortex (14) 1256-1265.
Meijsing, M. (2006). Being Ourselves and Knowing Ourselves: An Adverbial Account of Mental Representations. Consciousness and Cognition (15) 605-619.
Although imagery is not the main focus of this paper, enough is said to make it clear that the adverbial theory of mental representation being proposed is intended to be applicable to imagery. Rabb (1975), Heil (1982), and Tye (1984) also defend an adverbial theory of imagery.
Mel, B.W. (1986). A Connectionist Learning Model for 3- Dimensional Mental Rotation, Zoom, and Pan. In Program of the Eighth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Mel, B.W. (1990). Connectionist Robot Motor Planning. San Diego, CA: Academic Press.
A connectionist account of imagery, that links it to action plans.
Mellet, E., Tzourio, N., Crivello, F., Joliot, M., Denis, M., & Mazoyer, B. (1996). Functional anatomy of spatial mental imagery generated from verbal instructions. Journal of Neuroscience (16) 6504-6512.
Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain (cf. D'Esposito et al., 1997). For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999). See Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for a review of this issue and an attempt to reconcile the conflicting findings.
Merritt, J.O. (1979). None in a Million: Results of Mass Screening for Eidetic Ability Using Objective Tests Published in Newspapers and Magazines. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 612.
Despite hard searching, no other individuals with anything approaching the sorts of eidetic abilities claimed for Elizabeth (Stromeyer & Psotka, 1970; Stromeyer, 1970) could be found.
Michelon P. & Koenig, O. (2002). On the Relationship Between Visual Imagery and Visual Perception: Evidence from Priming Studies. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (14) 161-184.
Michimata, C. (1997). Hemispheric Processing of Categorical and Coordinate Spatial Relations in Vision and Visual Imagery. Brain and Cognition (33) 370-387.
Miller, A.I. (1984). Imagery in Scientific Thought: Creating 20th Century Physics. Boston MA: Birkhäuser.
Argues for an essential role for imagery in modern physical thought (and scientific thought in general).
Minsky, M. (1986). The Society of Mind. New York: Simon & Schuster.
Mitchell, D.B. & Richman, C.L. (1980). Confirmed Reservations: Mental Travel. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (6) 58-66.
Miyashita, Y. (1995). How the Brain Creates Imagery: Projection to Primary Visual Cortex. Science (268) 1719-1720.
Modrak, D.K.W. (1986). Phantasia Reconsidered. Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie (68) 47-69.
Modrak, D.K.W. (1987). Aristotle: The Power of Perception. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Modrak, D.K.W. (2001). Aristotle's Theory of Language and Meaning. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Imagination (phantasia) and imagery (phantasmata) played large roles in the theory.
Moran, T.P. (1973). The Symbolic Imagery Hypothesis: A Production System Model. Ph.D. thesis. Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA. (University Microfilms 74-14,657.)
Morgan, M. J. (1979). The Two Spaces. In N. Bolton (Ed.), Philosophical Problems in Psychology (pp. 66-88). London: Methuen.
Argues that the space of mental imagery is not a separate mental space, but the ordinary space in which we live and act.
Morris, P.E. & Hampson, P.J. (1983). Imagery and Consciousness. Academic Press. London.
Usefully summarizes much experimental evidence. Covers quasi-pictorial, description, and enactive theories, and attempts a theoretical synthesis.
Mortensen, C. (1989). Mental Images: Should Cognitive Science Learn from Neurophysiology? In P. Slezak & W.R. Albury (Eds.), Computers, Brains and Minds (pp. 123-136). Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Moskowitz, E. & Berger, R. (1969). Rapid Eye Movements and Dream Imagery: Are They Related? Nature (224) 613-614.
Mowrer, O.H. (1960a). Learning Theory and the Symbolic Processes. New York: Wiley.
An attempt to introduce imagery into Behaviorist theory.
Mowrer, O.H. (1960b). Learning Theory and Behavior. New York: Wiley.
An attempt to introduce imagery into Behaviorist theory.
Mowrer, O.H. (1977). Mental Imagery: An Indispensible Psychological Concept. Journal of Mental Imagery (2) 303-321.
Theoretical and historical reflections.
Moyer, R.S. & Dumais S.T. (1978). Mental Comparison. In G.H. Bower (Ed.), The Psychology of Learning and Motivation, Volume 12. New York: Academic Press.
Munroe, K J., Giacobbi, P.R.jr., Hall, C.R., & Weinberg, R. (2000). The Four W's of Imagery Use: Where, When, Why, and What. The Sport Psychologist (14) 119-137.
Nadaner, D. (1988). Visual Imagery, Imagination, and Education. In K. Egan & D. Nadaner (Eds.), Imagination and Education. Milton Keynes, U.K.: Open University Press.
Narayanan, N.H. (1993). Imagery: Computational and Cognitive Perspectives. Computational Intelligence (9) 303-308.
Neisser, U. (1967). Cognitive Psychology. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
The first textbook of the new Cognitive approach to psychology, which did much to set the new field's tone and direction. Its sections on imagery remain valuable.
Neisser, U. (1970). Visual Imagery as Process and as Experience. In J.S. Antrobus (Ed.), Cognition and Affect. Boston, MA: Little, Brown & Co.
Neisser, U. (1972a). Changing Conceptions of Imagery. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery. London: Academic Press.
Neisser, U. (1972b). A Paradigm Shift in Psychology. Science (176) 628-30.
A major player in the cognitive revolution places the revival of imagery research at its heart.
Neisser, U. (1976). Cognition and Reality. San Francisco, CA: W.H. Freeman.
Proposes one of the most fully developed versions of the enactive theory of imagery: an alternative to both pictorial/analog and propositional/descriptional accounts.
Neisser, U. (1978a). Anticipations, Images and Introspection. Cognition (6) 167-174.
Defends the theory of Neisser (1976) from the critique of Hampson & Morris (1978).
Neisser, U. (1978b). Perceiving, Anticipating and Imagining. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science (9) 89-106.
Summary version of the theory of Neisser (1976).
Neisser, U. (1979). Images, Models, and Human Nature. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 561.
A critical commentary on Kosslyn, Pinker, Smith and Schwartz (1979), rejecting their quasi-pictorial theory of imagery and their computational methodology.
Neisser, U. (Ed.) (1982). Memory Observed: Remembering in Natural Contexts. San Francisco: Freeman.
Neisser, U. & Kerr, N. (1973). Spatial and Mnemonic Properties of Visual Images. Cognitive Psychology (5) 138-150.
Evidence that imagery retains its mnemonic powers even when the objects to be remembered are imagined as concealed. It is claimed that this shows that mnemonically effective imagery is more spatial than visual, and that this supports Neisser's (1976) enactive theory of imagery. See Keenan & Moore (1979; Keenan, 1983) for a critique of this work, and Kerr & Neisser (1983) for a defense.
Newell, A. (1972). A Theoretical Exploration of Mechanisms for Coding the Stimulus. In A.W. Melton & E. Martin (Eds.), Coding Processes in Human Memory (pp. 373-434). Washington D.C.: Winston.
Newton, N. (1982). Experience and Imagery. The Southern Journal of Philosophy (21) 475-487.
Argues the importance of non-visual modes of imagery in human experience.
Newton, N. (1989). Visualizing is Imagining Seeing: a reply to White. Analysis (49) 77-81.
Newton, N. (1993). The Sensorimotor Theory of Cognition. Pragmatics and Cognition (1) 267-305.
Newton, N. (1996). Foundations of Understanding. Amsterdam: John Benjamins.
A sensorimotor theory of intentionality, imagery, and cognition.
Nicholas, J.M. (Ed.) (1977). Images, Perception and Knowledge, (Western Ontario Studies in the Philosophy of Science, #8). Dordrecht/Boston: Reidel.
Nichols, S., Stich, S., Leslie, A., & Klein, D. (1996). Varieties of Off-Line Simulation. In P. Carruthers & P.K. Smith (Eds.), Theories of Theories of Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Preprint available online
Section 3.3 is a critique of Currie's (1995) simulation account of imagery: Currie's proposal, it is argued, seems to be consistent with, and to add nothing to, other established, and more detailed, theories such as quasi-pictorialism and description theory. (Currie & Abell (1999) accept this criticism, and attempt to develop a more substantive account of simulationism that rejects quasi-pictorialism.)
Nussbaum, M.C. (1978). The Role of Phantasia in Aristotle's Explanation of Action. In her Aristotle's De Motu Animalium: Text with Translation, Commentary, and Interpretative Essays. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Nyíri, J.C. (2001). The Picture theory of Reason. In B. Brogaard & B. Smith (Eds.), Rationality and Irrationality (Schriftenreihe-Wittgenstein Gesellschaft, Vol. 29). Vienna: Öbv&hpt. Preprint available online
A contemporary philosophical defence of imagery theories of thought and meaning, and a retrospect on their 20th century eclipse.
O'Boyle, Michael.W., Cunnington, R., Silk T.J., Vaughan, D., Jackson, G., Syngeniotis, A., & Egan, G.F. (2005). Mathematically Gifted Male Adolescents Activate a Unique Brain Network During Mental Rotation. Cognitive Brain Research (25) 583-587.
O'Connor, K.P. & Aardema, F. (2005). The Imagination: Cognitive, Pre-cognitive, and Meta-cognitive Aspects. Consciousness and Cognition (14) 233-256.
O'Craven, K.M. & Kanwisher, N. (2000). Mental Imagery of Faces and Places Activates Corresponding Stimulus Specific Brain Regions. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (12) 1013-1023.
Ogden, J.A. (1985). Contralesional Neglect of Constructed Visual Images in Right and Left Brain-Damaged Patients. Neuropsychologia (23) 273-277.
O'Regan, J. K., & Noë, A. (2001). A Sensorimotor Account of Vision and Visual Consciousness. Behavoral and Brain Sciences (24) 939-973. Reprint available online
Oyama, T. & Ichikawa, S. (1990). Some Experimental Studies on Imagery in Japan. Journal of Mental Imagery (14) 185-196.
Paivio, A. (1963). Learning of Adjective-Noun Paired Associates as a Function of Adjective-Noun Word Order and Noun Abstractness. Canadian Journal of Psychology (17) 370-379.
Paivio, A. (1965). Abstractness, Imagery and Meaningfulness in Paired Associate Learning. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (4) 32-38.
Paivio, A. (1971). Imagery and Verbal Processes. New York: Holt, Rinehart and Winston. (Republished in 1979 – Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.)
Classic statement of the Dual Coding (imaginal and linguistic) theory of memory and mental representation, with much empirical evidence on the mnemonic effects of imagery. Paivio's work (together with Shepard's mental rotation experiments) probably played the key role in re-establishing imagery as a scientifically wothwhile topic of investigation in cognitive science, aftre the era of Behaviorist neglect of the phenomenon.
Paivio, A. (1975a). Imagery and Synchronic Thinking. Canadian Psychological Review (16) 147-163.
Paivio, A. (1975b) Perceptual Comparisons Through the Mind's Eye. Memory and Cognition (3) 635-647.
Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1978a, 1978b).
Paivio, A. (1975c). Neomentalism. Canadian Journal of Psychology (29) 263-291.
Paivio, A. (1977). Images, Propositions and Knowledge. In J.M. Nicholas (Ed.), Images, Perception and Knowledge. Dordrecht/Boston, MA: Reidel.
Paivio, A. (1978a). Comparisons of Mental Clocks. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (4) 61-71.
Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1975b. 1978b).
Paivio, (1978b), Mental Comparisons Involving Abstract Attributes. Memory and Cognition (6) 199-208.
Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1975b. 1978a).
Paivio, A. (1979). Psychological processes in the Comprehension of Metaphor. In A. Ortony (Ed.), Metaphor and Thought (pp. 150-171). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Paivio, A. (1983a). The Empirical Case for Dual Coding. In J.C. Yuille (Ed.), Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio. Hillsdale NJ: Erlbaum.
Paivio, A. (1983b). The Mind's Eye in Arts and Science. Poetics (12) 1-18.
Paivio, A. (1986). Mental Representations: A Dual Coding Approach. New York: Oxford University Press.
A major restatement and defense of Dual Coding Theory.
Paivio, A. (1991). Dual Coding Theory: Retrospect and Current Status. Canadian Journal of Psychology (45) 255-287.
Paivio, A. (1995). Imagery and Memory. In M.S. Gazzaniga (Ed.) The Cognitive Neurosciences. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. (pp. 977-986.)
Paivio, A. (2007). Mind and Its Evolution: A Dual Coding Theoretical Approach. Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum.
Paivio, A. & Begg I. (1981). Psychology of Language. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
Paivio, A. & Desrochers, A. (1980). A Dual Coding Approach to Bilingual Memory. Canadian Journal of Psychology (34) 390-401.
Paivio, A. & Harshman, R. (1983). Factor Analysis of a Questionnaire on Imagery and Verbal Habits and Skills. Canadian Journal of Psychology (37) 461-483.
Paivio, A., Yuille, J.C., & Madigan, S. (1968). Concreteness, Imagery and Meaningfulness Values for 925 Nouns. Journal of Experimental Psychology Monographs (78 – #1, part 2).
Palmer, S.E. (1975a). Visual Perception and World Knowledge: Notes on a Model of Sensory-Cognitive Interaction. In D.A. Norman, D.E. Rumelhart et al. (Eds.), Explorations in Cognition. San Francisco: W.H. Freeman.
Palmer, S.E. (1975b). The Nature of Perceptual Representation: An Examination of the Analog/propositional Controversy. In R. Schank & B.L. Webber (Eds.), Theoretical Issues in Natural Language Processing (pp. 165-172). Cambridge, MA: TINLAP.
Palmer, S.E. (1977). Hierarchical Structure in Perceptual Representation. Cognitive Psychology (9) 441-474.
Palmer, S.E. (1978). Fundamental Aspects of Cognitive Representation. In E. Rosch & B.B. Lloyd (Eds.), Cognition and Categorization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Argues that the analog/propositional debate over imagery misses the point about the nature of representation in computational theories of mind.
Pear, T.H. (1924). Imagery and Mentality. British Journal of Psychology (14) 291-299.
Pear, T.H. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the Process of Thinking 1. British Journal of Psychology (18) 1-14.
A companion piece to Bartlett (1927) and Aveling (1927).
Pelizzon, L., Brandimonte, M.A., & Favretto, A. (1999). Imagery and Recognition: Dissociable Measures of Memory? European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (11) 429-443.
Penfield, W. (1958). Some Mechanisms of Consciousness Discovered During Electrical Stimulation of the Brain. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences (44) 51-66.
Perky, C.W. (1910) An Experimental Study of Imagination. American Journal of Psychology (21) 422-52.
A famous study showing that mental images can be confused with (faint) percepts under certain, special conditions. See Segal (1971, 1972) for a modern attempt at replication.
Peterson, M.A., Kihlstrom, J.F., Rose, P.M., & Glisky, M.L. (1992). Mental Images Can be Ambiguous: Reconstruals and Reference Frame Reversals. Memory and Cognition (20), 107-123.
See the comment on Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Petre, M. & Blackwell, A.F. (1999). Mental Imagery in Program Design and Visual Programming. International Journal of Human-Computer Studies (51) 7-30.
A study of the (apparently quite significant) role played by imagery in the thought processes of computer programming.
Philippe, M.-D. (1971). Phantasia in the Philosophy of Aristotle. The Thomist (35) 1-42.
Piaget, J. & Inhelder, B. (1971). Mental Imagery in the Child. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. (Originally published in French as L'Image Mentale chez L'Enfant. Presses Universitaires de France, 1966.)
Pinker, S. (1980). Mental Imagery and the Third Dimension. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (109) 354-71.
Pinker, S. (1988). A Computational Theory of the Mental Imagery Medium. In M. Denis, J. Engelkamp, & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.), Cognitive and Neuropsychological Approaches to Mental Imagery. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff.
A three-dimensional version of the picture (or array) theory.
Pinker, S., Choate, P.A., & Finke, R.A. (1984). Mental Extrapolation in Patterns Constructed from Memory. Memory and Cognition (12) 207-218.
Pinker, S. & Finke, R.A. (1980) Emergent Two-Dimensional Patterns in Images Rotated in Depth. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (6) 244-264.
Pinker, S. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1978). The Representation and Manipulation of Three-Dimensional Space in Mental Images. Journal of Mental Imagery (2) 69-84.
Place, U.T. (1956). Is Consciousness a Brain Process? British Journal of Psychology (47) 44-50.
Imagery is one of Place's key examples of conscious experiences that, he argues, are best understood as contingently identical to brain processes. Despite this article's fame, and its seminal status in 20th century philosophy of mind, Place's specific views on mental imagery have received little attention. He always insisted, both here and in later work, that imagery (like other conscious experiences) was to be identified with brain processes rather than brain states.
Podgorny, P. & Shepard, R.N. (1978). Functional Representations Common to Visual Perception and Imagination. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (4) 21-35.
Prather, S.C. & Sathian, K. (2002). Mental Rotation of Tactile Stimuli. Cognitive Brain Research (14) 91-98.
Predebon, J. & Wenderoth, P. (1985). Imagined Stimuli: Imaginary Effects? Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (23) 215-216.
Pressey, A.W. & Wilson, A.E. (1974). The Poggendorff Illusion in Imagination. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (3) 447-449.
A visual illusion induced by imagery. This result may not be so easily explained away as the effect of experimental demand characteristics as are the similar findings of Wallace (1980, 1984) and Berbaum & Chung (1981).
Price, H.H. (1953). Thinking and Experience. London: Hutchinson.
Contains a defense of an imagery based account of thinking and meaning.
Prinz, J.J. (2002). Furnishing the Mind: Concepts and their Perceptual Basis. Boston, MA: MIT Press.
Defends an empricist theory of concepts, closely akin to the traditional image theory of ideas, but updated in the light of cognitive science. Strongly influenced by the work of Barsalou (1999).
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1973). What the Mind's Eye Tells the Mind's Brain: A Critique of Mental Imagery. Psychological Bulletin (80) 1-25.
A seminal attack on pictorial accounts of imagery. This was the opening salvo of the infamous analog/propositional dispute.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1978). Imagery and Artificial Intelligence. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science (9) 19-55.
Pylyshyn argues that images are best conceived of as propositional descriptions within a general computational account of mental representation.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1979a). The Rate of ‘Mental Rotation’ of Images: a Test of a Holistic Analogue Hypothesis. Memory and Cognition (7) 19-28.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1979b). Validating Computational Models: A Critique of Anderson's Indeterminacy of Representation Claim. Psychological Review (86) 383-394.
A commentary on Anderson (1978). See also Palmer (1978), Hayes-Roth (1979), and Anderson (1979).
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1981). The Imagery Debate: Analogue Media Versus Tacit Knowledge. Psychological Review (88) 16-45.
A restatement of the propositional/descriptional account of imagery that squarely confronts the empirical arguments brought by pictorialists.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1984). Computation and Cognition: Toward a Foundation for Cognitive Science. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2002a). Mental Imagery: In search of a theory. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 157-182 (-237 including commentaries and reply). Reprint available online
A major restatement and updating of Pylyshyn's conceptual and empirical objections to pictorial theories of imagery, including a critique of recent claims (e.g. Kosslyn, 1994; Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al., 1999) that neuroscientific evidence suports pictorialism.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2002b). Stalking the elusive mental image screen (reply to commentaries). Behavioral and Brain Sciences. (25) 216-237. Reprint available online
The reply to the invited commentaries on Pylyshyn (2002a). Expands usefully on what Pylyshyn sees as wrong with the neuroscience based arguments for pictorialism.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2003a). Return of the Mental Image: Are There Pictures in the Brain? Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7) 113-118. Reprint available online
Essentially a précis of Pylyshyn (2002 a & b), but with some additional examples.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2003b). Seeing and Visualizing : It's Not What You Think. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Preprint available online
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2003 c). Explaining Mental Imagery: Now You See It, Now You Don’t (Reply to Kosslyn et al.). Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7, #3) 111-112.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2005). Mental Imagery. In R.L. Gregory (ed.), The Oxford Companion to the Mind (2nd ed.) Oxford: Oxford University Press. Preprint available online
Succinctly restates Pylyshyn's major criticisms of pictorial theories of imagery.
Quaiser-Pohl, C., Geiser, C., & Lehmann, W. (2006). The Relationship Between Computer-game Preference, Gender, and Mental-rotation Ability. Personality and Individual Differences (40) 609-619.
Rabb, J.D. (1975). Imaging: An Adverbial Analysis. Dialogue (14) 312-318.
An adverbial theory of imagery. Cf. Heil (1982), Tye (1984), Meijsing (2006).
Ramachandran, V. S. & Hirstein, W. (1997). Three Laws of Qualia: What Neurology Tells Us about the Biological Functions of Consciousness. Journal of Consciousness Studies (4) 429-457.
Reed, S.K. (1974). Structural Descriptions and The Limitations of Visual Imagery. Memory and Cognition (2) 329-336.
Reed, S.K., Hock, H.S., & Lockhead, G.R. (1983). Tacit Knowledge and the Effect of Pattern Configuration on Mental Scanning. Memory and Cognition (11) 137-143.
Rees, D.A. (1971). Aristotle's Treatment of Phantasia. In J.P. Anton & G.L. Kustas (Eds.) Essays in Ancient Greek Philosophy (pp. 491-504). Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
Reid, T. (1764). An Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense. (Edition of D. Brookes. University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press, 1997.)
Interprets the ideas of his philosophical predecessors as mental images, and rejects the concept of idea partly on that basis.
Reid, T. (1785). Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man. (Edition of D. Brookes. University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press, 2002.)
Interprets Locke (and other philosophers who rely on a concept of idea) as holding that ideas are images, and rejects the concept of idea partly on that basis.
Reisberg, D. (Ed.) (1992). Auditory Imagery. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Reisberg, D. (1994). Equipotential Recipes for Unambiguous Images: A Reply to Rollins. Philosophical Psychology (7) 359-366.
See Rollins (1994) and the annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Reisberg, D. & Chambers, D. (1991). Neither Pictures Nor Propositions: What Can We Learn From a Mental Image? Canadian Journal of Psychology (45) 336-352.
See annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Reisberg, D., Culver, L.C., Heuer, F., & Fischman, D. (1986). Visual Memory: When Imagery Vividness Makes a Difference. Journal of Mental Imagery (10) 51-74.
Individual differences study using the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). Vivid imagers show worse color memory than less vivid imagers. A companion piece to Heuer, Fischman, & Reisberg (1986).
Reisberg, D. & Morris, A. (1985). Images Contain What the Imager Put There: A Nonreplication of Illusions in Imagery. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (23) 493-496.
A rebuttal to Wallace (1984). Also see Predebon & Wenderoth (1985).
Reisberg, D., Pearson, D.G., & Kosslyn, S.M. (2003). Intuitions And Introspections About Imagery: The Role Of Imagery Experience In Shaping An Investigator's Theoretical Views. Applied Cognitive Psychology (17) 147-160
People's initial theoretical intuitions about the nature of imagery correlate with how vivid they take their own imagery to be. (Vividness assessed by the VVIQ questionnaire (Marks, 1973)).
Reisberg, D., Smith, J.D., Baxter, D.A., & Sonenshine, M. (1989). “Enacted” Auditory Images are Ambiguous; “Pure” Auditory Images are Not. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (41A) 619-641.
An auditory analogue of the effect discovered by Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Reisberg, D., Wilson, M., & Smith, J.D. (1991). Auditory Imagery and Inner Speech. In R.H. Logie & M. Denis (Eds.), Mental Images in Human Cognition. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science Publishers B.V. (pp. 59-81).
Rey, G. (1981). Introduction: What are Mental Images? In N. Block (Ed.) Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Vol. 2. London: Methuen.
Rhem, L.P. (1973). Relationships Among Measures of Visual Imagery. Behavior Research and Therapy (11) 265-270.
Rhodes, G. & O'Leary, A. (1985) Imagery Effects on Early Visual Processing. Perception and Psychophysics (37) 382-388.
Ribot, T. (1890). Psychologie de L'Attention. Paris: Alcan. (Translated as: The Psychology of Attention. Chicago: Open Court, 1903.)
Sketches a theory of imagery in terms of the control of attention.
Ribot, T. (1900). Essai sur L'Imagination Créatrice. Paris: Alcan. (Translated as: Essay on the Creative Imagination. Chicago: Open Court, 1906.)
Includes an attentional theory of imagery, broadly akin to the motor theories of Dunlap (1914) and Washburn (1916).
Richards, N. (1977). Depicting and Visualising. Mind (82) 218-229.
Richardson, A. (1969). Mental Imagery. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
Despite its age, this remains a useful literature review, especially because it covers not only mental imagery in the narrower sense in which the term is usually used today (what Richardson calls “memory imagery”), but also other more or less distantly related quasi-perceptual phenomena such as eidetic imagery, hypnagogic imagery, hallucinations, and after-images.
Richardson, D.C. & Spivey, M.J. (2000). Representation, Space and Hollywood Squares: Looking at Things That Aren't There Anymore. Cognition (76) 269-295.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1975). Concreteness and Imagability. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (27) 235-249.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1980). Mental Imagery and Human Memory. London: Macmillan.
Although the book is mainly concerned with empirical issues, chapter two is a Wittgenstein influenced philosophical discussion of the concept of imagery.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1994). Gender Differences in Mental Rotation. Perceptual and Motor Skills (78) 435-488.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1995). The Efficacy of Imagery Mnemonics in Memory Remediation. Neuropsychologia (33) 1345-1357.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1999). Mental Imagery. Psychology Press: Hove, U.K.
Useful textbook concisely surveying the cognitive psychology of imagery, including individual differences research.
Richman, C.L., Mitchell, D.B., & Reznick, J.S. (1979a). Mental Travel: Some Reservations. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (5) 13-18.
Richman, C.L., Mitchell, D.B., & Reznick J.S. (1979b). The Demands of Mental Travel: Demand Characteristics of Mental Imagery Experiments. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2) 564-565.
Richter, W., Somorjai, R., Summers, R., Jarmaz, M., Menon, R.S., Gati, J.S., Georgopoulos, A.P., Tegeler, C., Ugurbil, K., & Seong-Gi, K. (2000). Motor Area Activity During Mental Rotation Studied by Time-Resolved Single-Trial fMRI. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (12) 310-320.
Rilling M.E. & Neiworth J.J. (1987). Theoretical and Methodological Considerations for the Study of Imagery in Animals. Learning and Motivation (18) 57-79.
Robson, J. (1986). Coleridge's Images of Fantasy and Imagination. In D.G. Russell, D.F. Marks, & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.) Imagery 2 (pp.190-194). Dunedin, New Zealand: Human Performance Associates.
Mental imagery in Romantic psychological theory.
Rode, G., Revol, P., Rossetti, Y., Boisson, D., & Bartolomeo, P. (2007). Looking While Imagining: The Influence of Visual Input on Representational Neglect. Neurology (68) 432-437. Available online
Representational neglect is not ameliorated by blindfolding the patient. This suggests that the underlying representations responsible for imagery are damaged in this syndrome, rather than the neglect phenomenon being caused by distraction of attention toward the right during the process of image formation or examination.
Rode, G., Rossetti, Y., & Boisson, D. (2001). Prism Adaptation Improves Representational Neglect. Neuropsychologia (39) 1250-1254.
Rode, G., Rossetti, Y., Li, L., & Boisson, D. (1998). Improvement of Mental Imagery after Prism Exposure in Neglect: A Case Study. Behavioural Neurology (11) 251-258.
Rode, G., Rossetti, Y., Perenin, M.-T., & Boisson, D. (2004). Geographic Information Has to Be Spatialised to Be Neglected: A Representational Neglect Case. Cortex (40) 391-397. Available online from the Cortex archive
Further evidence regarding the neurological syndrome of representational neglect in which sufferers fail to report features to one side (usually the left) of an imagined scene (Bisiach & Luzzatti, 1978; Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, 1994). The findings appear to favor both an enactive theory of imagery (Thomas, 1999b; see Bartolomeo, 2002; Bartolomeo & Chokron, 2002) and the Dual Coding theory of the function of imagery in memory (Paivio, 1971, 1986, 2007; Sadoski & Paivio, 2001).
Rodway, P., Gillies, K., & Schepman, A. (2006). Vivid Imagers Are Better at Detecting Salient Changes. Journal of Individual Differences (27 #4) 218–228.
Roe, A. (1951). A Study of Imagery in Research Scientists. Journal of Personality (19) 459-70.
Finds social scientists, in particular, tend to report weak or absent imagery (but see Brewer & Schommer-Aikins, 2006).
Roffwarg, H., Dement, W., Muzio, J., & Fisher, C. (1962). Dream Imagery: Relationship to Rapid Eye Movements. Archives of General Psychiatry (7) 235-238.
Roland, P.E. & Gulyàs B. (1994). Visual Imagery and Visual Representation. Trends in Neuroscience (17) 281-286.
Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain (cf. D'Esposito et al., 1996). For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999). See Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for a review of this issue and an attempt to reconcile the conflicting findings.
Rollins, M. (1989). Mental Imagery: On the Limits of Cognitive Science. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
Considers the possibility of “pictorial attitudes” (analogous to propositional attitudes).
Rollins, M. (1994). Re: Reinterpreting Images. Philosophical Psychology (7) 345-358.
See Reisberg (1994) and the annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Rollins, M. (2001). The Strategic Eye: Kosslyn’s Theory of Imagery and Perception. Minds and Machines (11) 267-286.
Essay Review of Image and Brain: The Resolution of the Imagery Debate (Kosslyn, 1994).
Roskos-Ewoldsen, B., Intons-Peterson, M.J., & Anderson, R.E. (Eds.) (1993). Imagery, Creativity and Discovery: a Cognitive Perspective. Amsterdam: Elsevier.
Ross, J. & Lawrence, K.A. (1968). Some Observations on Memory Artifice. Psychonomic Science (13) 107-108.
An experimental validation of the effectiveness of the classical method of loci mnemonic (see Yates, 1966; Carruthers, 1990; Small, 1997; Rossi, 2000).
Rossi, P. (2000). Logic and the Art of Memory. (Translated by S. Clucas from the original Italian of 1983.) Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Classical, medieval, and early modern imagery mnemonics and their intellectual significance (c.f. Yates, 1966; Spence, 1985; Carruthers, 1990, 1998; Small, 1997).
Rossman, M.L. (2000). Guided Imagery for Self-Healing: An Essential Resource for Anyone Seeking Wellness. Tiburon, CA: HJ Kramer.
Roth, R.J. (1963). The Aristotelian Use of Phantasia and Phantasma. The New Scholasticism (37) 312-326.
Rowlands, M. (2006a). Body Language: Representation in Action. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Argues that some actions can be inherently representational, and their intentionality need not be derived from the intentionality of other mental representations. The actions involved in perception (as in O'Regan & Noë's (2001) sensorimotor theory of perception) may be of this type. The sensorimotor approach, despite superficial appearances to the contrary, can account for the phenomenology of imagery even better than more traditional theories.
Roy, D., Hsiao, K.-Y., & Mavridis N. (2004). Mental Imagery for a Conversational Robot. IEEE Transactions on Systems, Man, and Cybernetics – part B: Cybernetics (34) 1374-1383. Preprint available online
Ruggieri, V. (1999). The Running Horse Stops: The Hypothetical Role of the Eyes in Imagery of Movement. Perceptual and Motor Skills (89) 1088-1092.
Ruggieri, V. & Alfieri, G. (1992). The Eyes in Imagery and Perceptual Processes: First Remarks. Perceptual and Motor Skills (75) 287-290.
Evidence that imagery can affect the focusing of crystalline lens of eye.
Russeler, J., Scholz, J., Jordan, K., & Quaiser-Pohl, C. (2005). Mental Rotation of Letters, Pictures, and Three-dimensional Objects in German Dyslexic Children. Child Neuropsychology (11) 497-512.
Russell, B. (1919). On Propositions: What They are and How they Mean. Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume (2) 1-43. Reprinted in K. Blackwell (Ed.) (1983). The Collected Papers of Bertrand Russell, Volume 8: the Philosophy of Logical Atomism and Other Essays, 1914-19, (pp. 276-306). London: Allen & Unwin.
An imagery based theory of linguistic meaning.
Russell, B. (1921). The Analysis of Mind. London: Allen & Unwin.
Re-presents Russell's (1919) imagery based theory of linguistic meaning in the context of a general theory of mind.
Russell, D.G., Marks, D.F., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) Imagery 2. Dunedin, New Zealand: Human Performance Associates.
Proceedings of the Second International Imagery Conference (Swansea, Wales, 1985).
Russow, L.-M. (1978). Some Recent Work on Imagination. American Philosophical Quarterly (15) 57-66.
Russow, L.-M. (1980). Towards a Theory of Imagination. Southern Journal of Philosophy (28) 353-369.
Ryle, G. (1949). The Concept of Mind. London: Hutchinson.
Chapter 8 contains a seminal critique of pictorial accounts of imagery and questions the traditional concept of imagination as the image producing faculty. It is suggested that both imagination and imagery are conceptually related to pretending.
Ryle, G. (1971). Phenomenology versus The Concept of Mind. In his Collected Papers, Volume 1: Critical Essays. London: Hutchinson.
Some qualifications of the view expressed in Ryle (1949).
Ryle, G. (1979). On Thinking. Oxford: Blackwell.
Chapter 3 deals with “Thought and Imagination”.
Saariluoma, P. & Kalakoski, V. (1998). Apperception and Imagery in Blindfold Chess. Memory (6) 67-90.
Sadoski, M. & Paivio, A. (2001). Imagery and Text: A Dual Coding Theory of Reading and Writing. Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum.
For more on Dual Coding Theory, see above for many other citations to Paivio's work.
Samuels, M. & Samuels, N. (1975). Seeing with the Mind's Eye: The History, Techniques and Uses of Visualization. New York/Berkeley, CA: Random House/The Bookworks.
Not a scholarly work.
Sarbin, T.R. (1972). Imagination as Muted Role Taking. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery, (pp. 333-354). Academic Press. New York.
A version of enactive imagery theory, strongly influenced by Ryle (1949).
Sarbin, T.R. & Juhasz, J.B. (1970). Toward a Theory of Imagination. Journal of Personality (38) 52-76.
A version of enactive imagery theory (see Thomas, 1999b).
Sartre, J.-P. (1936). Imagination: A Psychological Critique. (Translated from the French by F. Williams, Ann Arbor, MI: University of Michigan Press, 1962.)
An insightful critical account of early 20th century European views of imagery and imagination.
Sartre, J.-P. (1940). The Psychology of Imagination. (Translated from the French by B. Frechtman, New York: Philosophical Library, 1948.)
Presents Sartre's own positive theory of imagery and imagination. Argues for the intentionality of imagery, and holds that mental images are not inner objects.
Scarry, E. (1999). Dreaming by the Book. Princeton NJ: Princeton University Press.
A literary critic on the power of language to evoke mental imagery, and the importance of such imagery in the proper appreciation of literature. Cf. Esrock (1994).
Scheerer, E. (1984). Motor Theories of Cognitive Structure: A Historical Review. In W.Prinz & A.F. Sanders (Eds.), Cognition and Motor Processes. Berlin/Heidelberg: Springer-Verlag. (pp. 77-98).
Includes a brief description of Washburn's (1916) motor theory of imagery.
Schlaegel, T.F. (1953). The Dominant Method of Imagery in Blind as Compared to Sighted Adolescents. Journal of Genetic Psychology (83) 265-277.
Schlick M. (1918). General Theory of Knowledge. (Translation from the 2nd German edition (1925) by A.E. Blumberg, Vienna/New York: Springer-Verlag, 1974.)
Argues, on grounds derived from Berkeley, that concepts cannot be rooted in imagery, and that science cannot rely on “knowing by means of images”. Schlick went on to become the leader of the Logical Positivist Vienna Circle.
Schofield, M. (1978). Aristotle on the Imagination. In G.E.R. Lloyd & G.E.L. Owen (Eds.) Aristotle on the Mind and the Senses (pp. 99-140). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Schwitzgebel, E. (2002a). How Well do we Know our Own Conscious Experience? The Case of Visual Imagery. Journal of Consciousness Studies (9, v-vi) 35-53. Reprint available online
Argues that we we do not have a very good grasp of what our imagery experience is subjectively like.
Schwitzgebel, E. (2002b). Why Did We Think We Dreamed in Black and White? Studies in History and Philosophy of Science (33) 649-660. Reprint available online
Evidence that we we do not have a very good grasp of what our own subjective experience is like.
Segal, S.J. (Ed.) (1971a). Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches. New York: Academic Press.
Segal, S.J. (1971b). Processing of the Stimulus in Imagery and Perception. In S.J. Segal (Ed.) Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches, (pp. 73-100). New York: Academic Press.
On attempting to replicate the Perky (1910) experiment.
Segal, S.J. (1972). Assimilation of a Stimulus in the Construction of an Image: The Perky Effect Revisited. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery, (pp. 203-230). New York & London: Academic Press.
Segal, S.J. & Fusella, V. (1971). Effects of Images in Six Sense Modalities on Detection (d’) of Visual Signal from Noise. Psychonomic Science (24) 55-56.
Segal, S.J. & Nathan, S. (1964). The Perky Effect: Incorporation of an External Stimulus into Imagery Experience under Placebo and Control Conditions. Perceptual and Motor Skills (18) 385-395.
Sergent, J. (1990). The Neuropsychology of Visual Image Generation: Data, Method, and Theory. Brain and Cognition (13) 98-129.
Challenges the conclusions of Farah (1984).
Sheehan, P.W. (1967). A Shortened Version of the Betts' Questionnaire upon Mental Imagery. Journal of Clinical Psychology (23) 386-389.
Known as the QMI, and based on Betts (1909), this is a self report questionnaire on subjective imagery vividness, covering imagery of all sense modes. The VVIQ of Marks (1973) restricts itself to asking about the vividness of visual imagery only.
Sheehan, P.W. (Ed.) (1972). The Function and Nature of Imagery. Academic Press. New York & London.
Valuable anthology of the state of the art at the time.
Sheehan, P.W. (1978). Mental Imagery. In B.M. Foss (Ed.) Psychology Survey. No.1. London: Allen & Unwin.
Good review article, but now very dated.
Sheehan, P.W. & Neisser, U. (1969). Some Variables Affecting the Vividness of Imagery in Recall. British Journal of Psychology (60) 71-80.
Sheffield, F.D. (1961). Theoretical Considerations in the Learning of Complex Sequential Tasks from Demonstration and Practice. In A.A. Lumsdaine (Ed.) Student Response in Programmed Instruction (NAS-NRS Publication No. 943). Washington, DC: National Academy of Sciences—National Research Council.
Imagery introduced into an essentially Behaviorist theory.
Sheikh, A.A. (Ed.) (1983). Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application. New York: Wiley.
Wide ranging collection representing the state of the art at the time.
Sheikh, A.A. (2002). Healing Images: The Role of Imagination in Health. Amityville, NY: Baywood.
A recent collection of essays on therapeutic techniques that involve imagery.
Shepard, R.N. (1975). Form, Formation, and Transformation of Internal Representations. In R.L. Solso (Ed.) Information Processing and Cognition: the Loyola Symposium. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Defends an analog account of imagery. Introduces the concept of “second order isomorphism”.
Shepard, R.N. (1978a). Externalization of Mental Images and the Act of Creation. In B.S. Randhawa & B.F. Coffman (Eds.), Visual Learning, Thinking and Communication. London: Academic Press.
Shepard, R.N. (1978b). The Mental Image. American Psychologist (33) 125-137.
Probably Shepard's clearest statement of his views about the nature of imagery, its analog nature and its “second order isomorphism” to what it represents.
Shepard, R.N. (1981). Psychophysical Complementarity. In M. Kubovy & J.R. Pomerantz (Eds.) Perceptual Organization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Shepard, R.N. (1984). Ecological Restraints on Internal Representation. Psychological Review (91) 417-447.
Shepard, R.N. & Chipman, S. (1970). Second Order Isomorphism of Internal Representations: Shapes of States. Cognitive Psychology (1) 1-17.
Shepard, R.N., Cooper, L.A., et al. (1982). Mental Images and Their Transformations. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
A useful compendium of the seminal work by Shepard and his students on the mental rotation of images (and related phenomena).
Shepard, R.N. & Feng, C. (1972). A Chronometric Study of Mental Paper Folding. Cognitive Psychology (3) 228-243. (Reprinted as chapter 9 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Shepard, R.N. & Metzler, J. (1971). Mental Rotation of Three-Dimensional Objects. Science (171) 701-703.
A classic psychological experiment. The first, most striking, and best known of the mental rotation studies. Together with the work on the mnemonic effects of imagery (see Paivio, 1971) this played a major role in re-establishing the scientific respectability of imagery research.
Shepard, R.N. & Podgorny, P. (1978). Cognitive Processes That Resemble Perceptual Processes. In W.K. Estes (Ed.) Handbook of Learning and Cognitive Processes. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Sheppard, A. (1991). Phantasia and Mental Images: Neoplatonist Interpretations of De Anima, 3.3. In H. Blumenthal & H. Robinson (Eds.) Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy: Supplementary Volume 1991: Aristotle and the Later Tradition (pp. 165-173). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Shields, C. (2000). “Subordinate Psychic Faculties of Imagination and Desire, Supplementary Document to Aristotle's Psychology”, in Edward N. Zalta (Ed.) The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Summer 2002 Edition. URL = http://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2002/entries/aristotle-psychology/supp7.html.
Shorter, J.M. (1952). Imagination. Mind (61) 528-542.
Perhaps the earliest suggestion that imagining is more like describing than like seeing a picture (C.f. Dennett, 1969).
Simon, H.A. (1972). What is Visual Imagery? An Information Processing Interpretation. In L.W. Gregg (Ed.), Cognition in Learning and Memory. New York: Wiley.
Early sketch of a computational model of imagery.
Simpson, P. (1985). Lyons and Tigers. Analysis (45) 169-171.
Attempts to rebut Lyons' (1984) critique of the "image indeterminacy" argument against pictorialism due to Shorter (1952) and Dennett (1969). See note 31 to the main entry for an account of this argument and its shortcomings.
Skinner, B.F. (1953). Science and Human Behavior. New York: The Free Press.
Imagery as “conditioned seeing” or “operant seeing”.
Skinner, B.F. (1974). About Behaviorism. New York: Knopf.
Imagery is not an inner representation but a covert behavior.
Skinner, B.F. (1980). Notebooks. (Ed. & Introduction by R. Epstein). Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
Slezak, P. (1991). Can Images be Rotated and Inspected? A Test of the Pictorial Medium Theory. In Proceedings, Thirteenth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 55-60). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. Reprint available online
See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Slezak, P. (1992). When Can Visual Images Be Re-Interpreted? Non-Chronometric Tests of Pictorialism. In Proceedings, Fourteenth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 124-129). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. Reprint available online
See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Slezak, P. (1993). Artificial imagery? Computational Intelligence (9) 349-352.
Slezak, P. (1995). The “Philosophical” Case Against Visual Imagery. In P. Slezak, T. Caelli, & R. Clark (Eds.) Perspectives on Cognitive Science: Theories, Experiments and Foundations. Norwood, NJ: Ablex.
An empirically well informed philosopher makes the cognitivist case against pictorialism. A valuable supplement to Pylyshyn's arguments.
Slezak, P. (2002) The Tripartite Model of Representation. Philosophical Psychology (13) 239-270.
Slingerland, E. (2003). Effortless Action: Wu-wei as Conceptual Metaphor and Spiritual Ideal in Early China. New York: Oxford University Press.
Applies the cognitive metaphor and image schema theory of Lakoff & Johnson (1980, 1999; Johnson, 1987) to the analysis of classical Chinese thought.
Small, J.P. (1997). Wax Tablets of the Mind: Cognitive Studies of Memory and Literacy in Classical Antiquity. London & New York: Routledge.
Covers classical imagery mnemonics. See also, Yates (1966), Spence (1985), Carruthers, (1990, 1998), Rossi (2000).
Snoeyenbos, M. & Sibley, E. (1978). Sartre on Imagination. Southern Journal of Philosophy (16) 373-388.
Sober, E. (1976). Mental Representations. Synthése (33) 101-148.
Largely a discussion of the possibilities of mental representation via imagery.
Sommer, R. (1978). The Mind's Eye. New York: Delacorte Press.
Includes an interesting case study of a “non-imager” .
Sorabji, R. (1972). Aristotle on Memory. Providence, RI: Brown University Press.
Imagery played a large role in Aristotle's theory. Sorabji's introduction to Aristotle's text illuminates not just that text, but also the topics of imagery and memory themselves.
Sosa, D. (2006). Scenes Seen. Philosophical Books (47) 314-325.
Essay review of McGinn's Mindsight (2004). See McGinn (2006) for reply.
Sparing, R., Mottaghy, F.M., Ganis, G., Thompson, W.L., Töpper, R., Kosslyn, S.M., & Pascual-Leone, A. (2002). Visual Cortex Excitability Increases During Visual Imagery - A TMS Study in Healthy Human Subjects. Brain Research (938) 92-97.
Sparshott, F. (1990). Imagination – The Very Idea. Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism (48) 1-8.
Spence, J.D. (1985). The Memory Palace of Matteo Ricci. New York: Viking Penguin.
The story of how Ricci, a late 16th century Jesuit missionary, attempted to introduce European style imagery based mnemonic techniques (see: Yates, 1966; Carruthers, 1990; Small, 1997; Rossi, 2000) into China. Provides quite a detailed account of the elaborate Renaissance mnemonic system that Ricci presented.
Sperry, R.W. (1952). Neurology and the Mind-Brain Problem. American Scientist (40) 291-312.
A famous neuroscientist argues for what is essentially a version of the motor theory of mind, on the grounds that is suggested by what is known (in 1952)about neuroscience, and offers a promising approach to naturalizing consciousness (including, explicitly, mental imagery).
Spivey, M.J. & Geng J.J. (2001). Oculomotor Mechanisms Activated by Imagery and Memory: Eye Movements to Absent Objects. Psychological Research (65) 235-241.
Eye movements during imagery re-enact those that would be expected during perception of a similar scene. This lends support to the enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Hochberg, 1968; Sarbin & Juhasz, 1970; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). For further evidence for re-enactive perceptual behavior during imagery see: Brandt & Stark (1997), Johansson et al. (2005, 2006), Demarais & Cohen (1998), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), and Hong et al. (1997).
Squires, J.E.R. (1968). Visualising. Mind (77) 58-67.
Sterelny, K. (1986). The Imagery Debate. Philosophy of Science (53) 560-583.
A philosopher's take on the analog/propositional debate.
Strawson, P.F. (1971). Imagination and Perception. In L. Foster & J.L. Swanson (Eds.), Experience and Theory (pp. 31-54). London: Duckworth.
Kant's theory of the imagination.
Stromeyer, C.F. (1970). Eidetikers. Psychology Today (November 1970) 76-80.
The story of a very untypical adult eidetiker. This article publicized Elizabeth's unbelievable alleged feats to a mass audience. An abridged version is reprinted by Neisser (1982).
Stromeyer, C.F. & Psotka, J. (1970). The Detailed Texture of Eidetic Imagery. Nature (225) 346-349.
This well known and spectacular demonstration of the abilities of an eidetic imager has proven impossible to replicate. See Merritt (1979).
Stucki, D. J., & Pollack, J. B. (1992). Fractal (Reconstructive Analogue) Memory. In Proceedings, Fourteenth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
A proposal for a format for the deep representation within a connectionist implementation of a quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Sunderland, A. (1990). The Bisected Image? Visual Memory in Patients With Visual Neglect. In P.J. Hampson, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.), Imagery: Current Developments (pp. 333-350). London: Routledge.
Taylor, J.G. (1973). A Behavioural Theory of Images. South African Journal of Psychology (3) 1-10.
A rare attempt to assimilate imagery into Behaviorist theory, but see also Skinner (1953, 1974).
Taylor, P. (1981). Imagination and Information. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (42) 205-223.
Despite arguments to the contrary from Sartre and Wittgenstein, we can gain new information from our mental imagery.
Teng, N.Y. (1998). The Depictive Nature of Visual Mental Imagery. Presented at the 20th World Congress of Philosophy, August 6-10 1998, Boston, MA. Available online
Terlecki, M.S. & Newcombe, N.S. (2005). How Important Is the Digital Divide? The Relation of Computer and Videogame Usage to Gender Differences in Mental Rotation Ability. Sex Roles (53) 433-441.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1987). The Psychology of Perception, Imagination and Mental Representation, and Twentieth Century Philosophies of Science. Ph.D. thesis, Leeds University, Leeds, U.K. (A.S.L.I.B. Index to Theses 37-iii No. 37-4561). Available online
Thomas, N.J.T. (1989). Experience and Theory as Determinants of Attitudes toward Mental Representation: The Case of Knight Dunlap and the Vanishing Images of J.B. Watson. American Journal of Psychology (102) 395-412. Preprint available online (also here)
Discusses the historical circumstances surrounding the “banishment” of imagery from psychological theory in the Behaviorist tradition, and considers certain conceptual confusions that may induce some people to discount the psychological significance of imagery. Dunlap's (1914) theory is outlined.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1997a). Imagery and the Coherence of Imagination: a Critique of White. Journal of Philosophical Research, (22) 95-127. Preprint available online
Defends the traditional (Aristotelian) view of the concept of imagination as derivative from the concept of imagery, and argues that the root concept of both is perceiving as. Traces resistance to the Aristotelian view to unsupported pictorialist assumptions. For an alternative (but not incompatible) defense of the conceptual connection between imagination and imagery see Kind (2001).
Thomas, N.J.T. (1997b). A Stimulus to the Imagination. Psyche (3) (Online serial). Available online
An essay review of Ellis (1995), which reviews some standard objections to the sort of imagery based semantics he proposes, and sets this idea of an imagery theory of meaning in its historical context.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1999a). Imagination. In C. Eliasmith (Ed.), Dictionary of Philosophy of Mind. Available online
Provides a brief sketch of the history of the concept, from Aristotle to the present.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1999b). Are Theories of Imagery Theories of Imagination? An Active Perception Approach to Conscious Mental Content. Cognitive Science (23) 207-245. Preprint available online (also here)
Discusses cognitive theories of imagery in the light of their relevance to theories of imagination and its role in creative thought. Proposes and defends a “perceptual activity” (enactive) theory of imagery, arguing that is both empirically and conceptually superior to both quasi-pictorial and propositional theories.
Thomas, N.J.T. (2002). The False Dichotomy of Imagery. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 211. Preprint available online
A commentary on Pylyshyn (2002a).
Thomas, N.J.T. (2003). Mental Imagery, Philosophical Issues About. In L. Nadel (Ed.), Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science (Volume 2, pp. 1147-1153). London: Nature Publishing/Macmillan. Preprint available online
Thomas, N.J.T. (2006). Fantasi, Eliminatiisme og Bevidsthedens Forhistorie. Slagmark: Tidsskrift for Idéhistorie (46) 15-31. (In Danish, but an English preprint version, “Imagination, Eliminativism, and the Pre-History of Consciousness,” is available online .)
Thompson, E. (2007a). Look Again: Phenomenology and Mental Imagery. Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences (6) 137-170.
Thompson, E. (2007b). Mind in Life: Biology, Phenomenology, and the Sciences of Mind. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Chapter 10 deals with mental imagery as a conscious phenomenon.
Tippett, L.J. (1992). The Generation of Visual Images: A Review of Neuropsychological Research and Theory. Psychological Bulletin (112) 415-432.
Titchener, E.B. (1901-5). Experimental psychology: A manual of laboratory practice (4 volumes). New York: Macmillan.
Titchener, E.B. (1909). Lectures on the Experimental Psychology of the Thought-Processes. New York: Macmillan.
A radical defense of an image and sensation centered introspective psychology against the claims of the Würzburg imageless thought school of introspectors.
Tomasino, B., Borroni, P., Isaja, A., & Rumiati, R.I. (2005). The Role of the Primary Motor Cortex in Mental Rotation: A TMS Study. Cognitive Neuropsychology (22) 348-363.
Trehub, A. (1977). Neuronal Models for Cognitive Processes: Networks for Learning, Perception and Imagination. Journal of Theoretical Biology (65) 141-169.
A neuroscientific account of imagery, that identifies it with activity in the retinotopic maps of the visual areas of the brain. Trehub (1991) provides a revised and more detailed version of the theory, which seems broadly consistent with the quasi-pictorial theory of Kosslyn (1980, 1994).
Trehub, A. (1991). The Cognitive Brain. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Ambitious and detailed neuroscientific theory, that, consistently with Kosslyn (1994), regards imagery as activity in the retinotopic maps of the brain's visual cortex.
Trojano, L. & Grossi, D. (1994) A Critical Review of Mental Imagery Defects. Brain and Cognition (24) 213-243.
Turnbull, K. (1994). Aristotle on Imagination: De Anima iii 3. Ancient Philosophy (14) 319-334.
Tweedale, M.M. (1990). Mental Representations in Later Medieval Scholasticism. In J.-C. Smith (Ed.), Historical Foundations of Cognitive Science. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer.
Tweney, R.D. (1987). Programmatic Research in Experimental Psychology: E.B. Titchener's Laboratory Investigations, 1891-1927. In M.G. Ash & W.R. Woodward (Eds.), Psychology in Twentieth Century Thought and Society (pp.34-57). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Tweney, R.D., Doherty, M.E., & Mynatt, C.R. (Eds.) (1981). On Scientific Thinking. New York: Columbia University Press.
Contains anecdotal but very suggestive extracts concerning the key role that imagery can play in the thought processes of scientists.
Tye, M. (1984). The Debate About Mental Imagery. Journal of Philosophy (81) 678-691.
An adverbial account of imagery that is abandoned in Tye's later writings on the subject. See Rabb (1975), Heil (1982), and Meijsing (2006) for alternative defenses of the adverbial theory.
Tye, M. (1988). The Picture Theory of Mental Images. Philosophical Review (97) 497-520.
A persuasive defense of quasi-pictorial theory against descriptionist criticisms.
Tye, M. (1991). The Imagery Debate. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
This fills out the argument of Tye (1988) and gives an admirably clear philosophical account of the analog/propositional debate and the conceptual basis of (quasi-)pictorialism. However, it fails to look seriously beyond this context, and is occasionally unreliable on historical and empirical issues.
Tyndall, J. (1872). On the Scientific Use of the Imagination. In his Fragments of Science (4th ed.) (pp. 125-161). London: Longmans, Green & Co.
A distinguished 19th century physicist discusses the role of imagery in scientific thinking.
Vanlierde, A. & Wanet-Defalque, M.C. (2004). Abilities and Strategies of Blind and Sighted Subjects in Visuo-Spatial Imagery. Acta Psychologica (116) 205-222.
Van't Hoff, J. H. (1878). Imagination in Science. (Anonymous English translation: Berlin: Springer-Verlag, 1967.)
A distinguished 19th century chemist argues for the importance of imagery in scientific thinking.
Vecchi, T. (1998). Visuo-Spatial Imagery in Congenitally Totally Blind People. Memory (6) 91-102.
von Eckardt, B. (1984). Mental Images and their Explanations. Journal of Philosophy (81) 691-693.
A rejoinder to Tye (1984) – and one he seems to have taken to heart (see Tye, 1988, 1991).
von, Eckardt, B. (1988). Mental Images and Their Explanations. Philosophical Studies (53) 441-460.
A further critique of Tye's (1984) adverbial theory, and a defense of quasi-pictorialism.
von Eckardt, B. (1993). What is Cognitive Science? Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Presents Kosslyn's research on imagery, and his quasi-pictorial theory (Kosslyn, 1980), as a paradigmatic example of Cognitive Science.
von Morstein, P. (1974). Imagine. Mind (83) 228-247.
Wallace, B. (1980). Autokinetic Movement of an Imagined and a Hypnotically Hallucinated Stimulus. International Journal of Clinical and Experimental Hypnosis (28) 386-393.
Subject to the same objections (perhaps a fortiori) as Wallace (1984).
Wallace, B. (1984). Apparent Equivalence between Perception and Imagery in the Production of Various Visual Illusions. Memory and Cognition (12) 156-162.
These results have been severely criticised as likely products of experimental demand characteristics, rather than real cognitive effects (Predebon & Wenderoth, 1985; Reisberg & Morris, 1985). However, Pressey & Wilson (1974) obtained similar results from a better designed experiment.
Walton, K.L. (1990). Mimesis as Make Believe: On the Foundations of the Representational Arts. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Warnock, M. (1976). Imagination. London: Faber & Faber.
See comment to Warnock (1994).
Warnock, M. (1994). Imagination and Time. Oxford: Blackwell.
In contrast to many other post-Wittgensteinian philosophers, Warnock depicts the imagination as a coherent, unified mental faculty, that both plays a crucial role in perception and, through imagery, enables us to recall the past and envisage the future. She also deals with the creative and aesthetic roles of imagination.
Washburn, M.F. (1916). Movement and Mental Imagery. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin.
A motor theory of imagery. See Dunlap (1914) for another version.
Watson, G. (1982). Phantasia in Aristotle, De Anima 3.3. Classical Quarterly (32) 100-113.
Watson, G. (1988). Phantasia in Classical Thought. Galway, Eire: Galway University Press.
Watson, J.B. (1913a). Psychology as the Behaviorist Views It. Psychological Review (20) 158-177. Reprint available online
The classic “Behaviorist manifesto”. Questions the very existence of imagery.
Watson, J.B. (1913b). Image and Affection in Behavior. Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods (10) 421-8.
A more careful and detailed version of the anti-imagery position put forward in Watson (1913a).
Watson, J.B. (1928). The Ways of Behaviorism. New York: Harper.
Reports of memory images are “sheer bunk”.
Weber, R.J. & Brown, S. (1986). Musical Imagery. Music Perception (3) 411-426.
Wedin, M.V. (1988). Mind and Imagination in Aristotle. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
Wekker, L.M. (1966). On the Basic Properties of the Mental Image and a General Approach to their Analogue Simulation. In Psychological Research in the U.S.S.R. Moscow: Progress Publishers.
Imagery theory in the Soviet psychological tradition. Somewhat similar to the motor theories of Dunlap (1914) and Washburn (1916).
Wexler, M., Kosslyn, S.M., & Berthoz, A. (1998). Motor Processes in Mental Rotation. Cognition (68) 77-94.
Wheeler, M.E., Petersen, S.E., & Buckner, R.L. (2000). Memory's Echo: Vivid Remembering Reactivates Sensory Specific Cortex. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the U.S.A. (97) 11125-11129.
White, A.R. (1990). The Language of Imagination. Oxford: Blackwell.
Part 1 is an excellent, if selective, concise history of the concept of imagination. Part 2 argues (in the teeth of the strong historical consensus detailed in part 1) that there is no conceptual connection whatsoever between imagination and imagery. See Thomas (1997a) for a critique of this view.
White, K. (1985). The Meaning of Phantasia in Aristotle's De Anima, III, 3-8. Dialogue (24) 483-505.
Wittgenstein, L. (1953). Philosophical Investigations. (Ed. G.E.M. Anscombe & R. Rhees, trans. G.E.M. Anscombe.). Oxford: Blackwell.
Contains a powerful and very influential critique of the imagery theory of linguistic meaning.
Wittgenstein, L. (1958). The Blue and Brown Books. (Ed. R. Rhees.). Oxford: Blackwell.
Opens with a critique of the imagery theory of linguistic meaning.
Wittgenstein, L. (1961). Zettel. (Ed. G.E.M. Anscombe & G.H. von Wright; trans. G.E.M. Anscombe.). Oxford: Blackwell.
Wittgenstein, L. (1980a). Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology: Volume 1. (Ed. G.E.M. Anscombe & G.H. von Wright; trans. G.E.M. Anscombe.). Oxford: Blackwell.
Wittgenstein, L. (1980b). Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology: Volume 2. (Ed. G.H. von Wright & H. Nyman; trans. C.G. Luckhardt & M.A.E. Aue.). Oxford: Blackwell.
This posthumous compilation of Wittgenstein's notes includes many scattered remarks or brief discusions about imagery (volume 1 of the Remarks and the Last Writings also contain a few). Most of the best points probably found their way into the Philosophical Investigations, however.
Wittgenstein, L. (1990). Last Writings on the Philosophy of Psychology. (ed. G.H. von Wright & H. Nyman, trans. C.G. Luckhardt & M.A.E. Aue.) Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Wollock, J. (1997). The Noblest Animate Motion: Speech, Physiology and Medicine in Pre-Cartesian Linguistic Thought. Amsterdam: John Benjamins.
Wraga, M. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2003). Imagery. In L. Nadel (Ed.) Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science, (Vol. 2, pp. 466-470). London: Nature Publishing/Macmillan.
A concise but superficial introduction to the cognitive science of imagery.
Wright, E. (1983). Inspecting Images. Philosophy (58) 57-72.
Wundt, W. (1912). An Introduction to Psychology (2nd edn.). New York: Macmillan. (Translated from the German.)
Yates, F.A. (1966). The Art of Memory. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
A celebrated and seminal history of mnemonic uses of imagery, from ancient to early modern times. Argues that such techniques have had a previously unrecognized importance in the history of western intellectual life. For more recent work on these issues see Spence (1985), Carruthers, (1990, 1998), Small (1997), and Rossi (2000).
Yolton, J.W. (1956). John Locke and the Way of Ideas. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1970). Locke and the Compass of Human Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1984). Perceptual Acquaintance from Descartes to Reid. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1985). Locke: An Introduction. Oxford: Blackwell.
See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1996). Perception and Reality: A History from Descartes to Kant. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Argues that the ideas of Locke (and, indeed, those of Hume) should not be understood to be mental images (i.e., pictures). See also Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985). For similar arguments see Chappell (1994), and Lowe (1995, 2005). For the opposing view see Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), or Price (1953).
Yomogida, Y., Sugiura, M., Watanabe, J., Akitsuki, Y., Sassa, Y., Sato, T., Matsue, Y., & Kawashima, R. (2004). Mental Visual Synthesis is Originated in the Fronto-temporal Network of the Left Hemisphere. Cerebral Cortex (14) 1376-1383.
“Visual mental synthesis” is here used to mean the production of “imagination imagery” of novel objects by the combination of parts or aspects of mental images of familiar objects.
Yuille, J.C. (Ed.) (1983a). Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Yuille, J.C. (1983b). The Crisis in Theories of Mental Imagery. In J.C. Yuille (Ed.), Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio (pp. 263-284). Hillsdale NJ: Erlbaum.
Zemach, E.M. (1969). Seeing, “Seeing”, and Feeling. Review of Metaphysics (23) 3-24.
Zikmund, V. (1972). Physiological Correlates of Visual Imagery. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery (pp. 355-387). New York: Academic Press.
Zimler, J. & Keenan, J.M. (1983). Imagery in the Congenitally Blind: How Visual are Visual Images? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (9) 269-282.
The mnemonic effects of imagery (that are normally assumed to work in sighted subjects via the formation of visual imagery) are also demonstrable with congenitally blind subjects (cf. Jonides, Kahn, & Rozin, 1975; Marmor & Zaback, 1976; Carpenter & Eisenberg, 1978; Kerr, 1983).