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Inductive Logic

An inductive logic is a system of evidential support that extends deductive logic to less-than-certain inferences. For valid deductive arguments the premises logically entail the conclusion, where the entailment means that the truth of the premises provides a guarantee of the truth of the conclusion. Similarly, in a good inductive argument the premises should provide some degree of support for the conclusion, where such support means that the truth of the premises indicates with some degree of strength that the conclusion is true. Presumably, if the logic of good inductive arguments is to be of any real value, the measure of support it articulates should meet the following condition:

Criterion of Adequacy (CoA):
As evidence accumulates, the degree to which the collection of true evidence statements comes to support a hypothesis, as measured by the logic, should tend to indicate that false hypotheses are probably false and that true hypotheses are probably true.

This article will focus on the kind of the approach to inductive logic most widely studied by philosophers and logicians in recent years. These logics employ conditional probability functions to represent measures of the degree to which evidence statements support hypotheses. This kind of approach usually draws on Bayes' theorem, which is a theorem of probability theory, to articulate how the implications of hypotheses about evidence claims influences the degree to which hypotheses are supported by those evidence claims. We will examine the extent to which this kind of logic may pass muster as an adequate logic of evidential support, especially in regard to the testing of scientific hypotheses. In particular, we will see how such a logic may be shown to satisfy the Criterion of Adequacy.

Sections 1 through 3 present all of the main ideas behind the probabilistic logic of evidential support. For most readers these three sections will suffice to provide an adequate understanding of the subject. Those readers who want to know more about how the logic applies when the implications of hypotheses about evidence claims (called likelihoods) are vague or imprecise may, after reading sections 1-3, skip down to section 6.

Sections 4 and 5 are for the more advanced reader who wants a detailed understanding of some telling results about how this logic may bring about convergence to the truth. These results show that the Criterion of Adequacy is indeed satisfied—that as evidence accumulates, false hypotheses will very probably come to have evidential support values (as measured by their posterior probabilities) that approach 0; and as this happens, a true hypothesis will very probably acquire evidential support values (as measured by their posterior probabilities) that approach 1.

• 1. Inductive Arguments
• 2. Inductive Logic and Inductive Probabilities
  • 2.1 The Historical Origins of Probabilistic Logic
  • 2.2 Probabilistic Logic: Axioms and Characteristics
  • 2.3 Two Conceptions of Inductive Probability
• 3. The Application of Inductive Probabilities to the Evaluation of Scientific Hypotheses
  • 3.1 Likelihoods
  • 3.2 Posterior Probabilities and Prior Probabilities
  • 3.3 Bayes' Theorem
  • 3.4 Likelihood Ratios, Likelihoodism, and the Law of Likelihood
  • 3.5 On Prior Probability Assessments—and Representations of Vague and Diverse Plausibility Assessments
• 4. Bayesian Estimation and Convergence for Enumerative Inductions
  • 4.1 Convergence to Agreement
  • 4.2 Convergence to the Truth
• 5. The Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem
  • 5.1 The Space of Possible Outcomes of Experiments and Observations
  • 5.2 Probabilistic Independence
  • 5.3 Likelihood Ratio Convergence when Falsifying Outcomes are Possible
  • 5.4 Likelihood Ratio Convergence when No Falsifying Outcomes are Possible
• 6. When the Likelihoods are Vague or Diverse
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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Example 1.. Every raven in a random sample of 3200 ravens is black. This strongly supports the hypothesis that all ravens are black.

Example 2. 62 percent of voters in a random sample of 400 registered voters (polled on February 20, 2004) said that they favor John Kerry over George W. Bush for President in the 2004 Presidential election. This supports with a probability of at least .95 the hypothesis that between 57 percent and 67 percent of all registered voters favor Kerry over Bush for President (at or around the time the poll was taken).

An argument of this kind is often called an induction by enumeration of cases. We may represent the logical form of such arguments semi-formally as follows:

Premise: In random sample S consisting of n members of population B, the proportion of members that have attribute A is r.

Therefore, with degree of support p,

Conclusion: The proportion of all members of B that have attribute A is between r−q and r+q (i.e., is within margin of error q of r).

Let's lay out this argument more formally. The Premise breaks down into three separate premises:^[1]

	Semi-formalization	Formalization
Premise 1	The frequency (or proportion) of members with attribute A among the members of S is r.	F[A,S] = r
Premise 2	S is a random sample of B with respect to whether or not its members have A	Rnd[S,B,A]
Premise 3	Sample S has exactly n members	Size[S] = n
Therefore	with degree of support p	========{p
Conclusion	The proportion of all members of B that have attribute A is between r−q and r+q (i.e. is within margin of error q of r)	F[A,B] = r ± q

Any inductive logic that encompasses such arguments should address two challenges. (1) It should tell us which enumerative inductive arguments should count as good inductive arguments rather than as inductive fallacies. In particular, it should tell us how to determine the appropriate degree p to which such premises inductively support the conclusion, for a given margin of error q. (2) It should demonstrably satisfy the CoA. That is, it should be provable (as a metatheorem) that if a conclusion expressing the approximate proportion for an attribute in a population is true, then it is very likely that sufficiently numerous random samples of the population will provide true premises for good inductive arguments that confer degrees of support p approaching 1 for that true conclusion—where, on pain of triviality, these sufficiently numerous samples are only a tiny fraction of a large population. Later we will see how a probabilistic inductive logic may meet these two challenges.

Enumerative induction is rather limited in scope. This form of induction is only applicable to the support of claims involving simple universal conditionals (i.e., claims of form ‘All Bs are As’) and claims about the proportion of an attribute in a population (i.e., ‘The frequency of As among the Bs is r’). And it applies only when the evidence for such claims consists of instances of Bs observed to be either As or non-As. However, many important empirical hypotheses are not reducible to this simple form, and the evidence for hypotheses is often not composed of simple instances. Consider, for example, the Newtonian Theory of Mechanics:

All objects remain at rest or in uniform motion unless acted upon by some external force. An object's acceleration (i.e., the rate at which its motion changes from rest or uniform motion) is in the same direction as the force exerted on it; and the rate at which the object accelerates due to a force is equal to the magnitude of the force divided by the object's mass. If an object exerts a force on another object, the second object exerts an equal amount of force on the first object, but in the opposite direction to the force exerted by the first object.

The evidence for (and against) this theory is not gotten by examining a randomly selected subset of objects and the forces acting upon them. Rather, the theory is tested by calculating observable phenomena entailed by it in a wide variety of specific situations—ranging from simple collisions between small bodies to the trajectories of planets and comets—and then seeing whether those phenomena really occur. This approach to testing hypotheses and theories is ubiquitous, and should be captured by an adequate inductive logic.

Many less theoretical instances of inductive reasoning also fail to be captured by enumerative induction. Consider the kinds of inferences members of a jury are supposed to make based on the evidence presented at a murder trial. The inference to probable guilt or innocence is usually based on a patchwork of various sorts of evidence. It almost never involves consideration of a randomly selected sequences of past situations when people like the accused committed similar murders. Or, consider how a doctor diagnoses her patient on the basis of his symptoms. Although the frequency of occurrence of various diseases when similar symptoms were present may play a role, this is clearly not the whole story. Diagnosticians commonly employ a form of hypothetical reasoning—e.g., if the patient has a brain tumor, would that account for all of his symptoms?; or are these symptoms more likely the result of a minor stroke?; or is there another possible cause? The point is that a full account of inductive logic should not be limited to enumerative induction, but should also explicate the logic of hypothetical reasoning through which hypotheses and theories are tested on the basis of their predictions about specific observations. In Section 3 we will see how a kind of probabilistic inductive logic called "Bayesian Confirmation Theory" captures such reasoning.

Some Prominent Approaches to the Represention of Uncertain Inferences.

Throughout its development various researchers appear to have thought of probability as a kind of logic. But the first extended treatment of probability as an explicit part of logic was George Boole's The Laws of Thought (1854). John Venn followed two decades later with an alternative empirical frequentist account of probability in The Logic of Chance (1876). Not long after that the whole discipline of logic was transformed by new developments in deductive logic.

In the late 19^th and early 20^th century Frege, followed by Russell and Whitehead, showed how deductive logic could be represented in the kind of rigorous formal system we now call quantificational logic or predicate logic. For the first time logicians had a fully formal deductive logic powerful enough to represent all valid deductive arguments in mathematics and the sciences—a logic in which the validity of deductive arguments depends only on the logical structure of the sentences involved. This development spurred some logicians to attempt to apply a similar approach to inductive reasoning. The idea was to extend the deductive entailment relation to a notion of probabilistic entailment for cases where premises provide less than conclusive support for conclusions. These partial entailments are expressed in terms of conditional probabilities, probabilities of the form P[C | B] = r (read “the probability of C given B is r”), where P is a probability function, C is a conclusion sentence, B is a conjunction of premise sentences, and r is the probabilistic degree of support that B provides for C. Attempts to develop such a logic have varied widely in regard to precisely how the deductive model is emulated.

Some inductive logicians have tried to follow the deductive paradigm very closely by attempting to specify inductive support probabilities in terms of the syntactic structures of premise and conclusion sentences. In deductive logic the syntactic structure of the sentences involved completely determines whether premises logically entail a conclusion. So these logicians attempted to specify inductive support probabilities solely in terms of the syntactic structure of premise and conclusion sentences. In such a system each sentence confers a syntactically specified degree of support on each of the other sentences of the language. The inductive probabilities in such a system are logical in the sense that they depend on syntactic structure alone. This kind of conception was articulated to some extent by John Maynard Keynes in his Treatise on Probability (1921). Rudolf Carnap pursued this idea with greater rigor in his Logical Foundations of Probability (1950) and in several subsequent works (e.g., Carnap 1952). (For details of Carnap's approach see the section on logical probability in the entry on interpretations of the probability calculus, in this Encyclopedia.)

In the inductive logics of Keynes and Carnap, Bayes' theorem, which is a theorem of probability theory, plays a central role in expressing how evidence comes to bear on hypotheses. (We'll examine Bayes' theorem later.) So, such approaches might well be called Bayesian logicist inductive logics. Other well-known Bayesian logicist attempts to develop a probabilistic inductive logic include (Jeffreys, 1939), (Jaynes, 1968), and (Rosenkrantz, 1981).

It is now generally held that the core idea of Bayesian logicism is fatally flawed—that syntactic logical structure cannot be the sole determiner of the degree to which premises inductively support conclusions. A crucial facet of the problem faced by Bayesian logicism involves how the logic is supposed to apply to scientific contexts where the conclusion sentence is some hypothesis or theory, and the premises are evidence claims. The difficulty is that in any probabilistic logic that satisfies the usual axioms for probabilities, the inductive support for a hypothesis must depend in part on its prior probability. This prior probability represents how plausible the hypothesis is supposed to be based on considerations other than the observational and experimental evidence (e.g. perhaps due to relevant plausibility arguments). A Bayesian logicist must tell us how to assign values to these pre-evidential prior probabilities of hypotheses, for each of the hypotheses or theories under consideration. Furthermore, this kind of Bayesian logicist must determine these prior probability values in a way that relies only on the syntactic logical structure of these hypotheses, perhaps based on some measure of their syntactic simplicities. There are severe technical problems with getting this idea to work. Moreover, various kinds of examples seem to show that such an approach must assign intuitively quite unreasonable prior probabilities to hypotheses in specific cases (see the footnote cited near the end of section 3.2 for details). Furthermore, for this idea to apply to the evidential support of real scientific theories, scientists would have to formalize theories in a way that makes their relevant syntactic structures apparent, and then evaluate theeories solely on that syntactic basis (together with their syntactic relationships to evidence statements). Are we to evaluate alternative theories of gravitation (and alternative quantum theories) this way? This seems an extremely doubtful approach to the evaluation of real scientific theories and hypotheses. Thus, it seems that logical structure alone cannot suffice for the inductive evaluation of scientific hypotheses. (This issue will be treated in more detail in Section 3, after we first see how probabilistic logics employ Bayes' theorem to represent the evidential support for hypotheses as a function of prior probabilities together with their evidential likelihoods.)

At about the time the Bayesian logicist idea was developing, an alternative conception of probabilistic inductive reasoning was also emerging. This approach is now generally referred to as the Bayesian subjectivist or personalist approach to inductive reasoning (see, e.g., Ramsey, 1926; De Finetti, 1937; Savage 1954; Edwards, Lindman, Savage, 1963; Jeffrey, 1983, 1992; Howson, Urbach, 1993; Joyce 1999). It treats inductive probability as part of a larger normative theory of belief and action known as Bayesian decision theory. The principle idea is that the strength of an agent's desires for various possible outcomes should combine with her belief-strengths regarding claims about the world to produce optimally rational decisions. Bayesian subjectivists provide a logic that captures this idea, and they attempt to justify this logic by showing that in principle it leads to optimal decisions about which of various risky alternatives should be pursued. On the Bayesian subjectivist or personalist account of inductive probability, inductive probability functions represent the subjective (or personal) belief-strengths of ideally rational agents, the kind of belief strengths that figure into rational decision making. (See the section on subjective probability in the entry on interpretations of the probability calculus, in this Encyclopedia.)

Elements of the logicist conception of inductive logic live on today as part of the general approach called Bayesian inductive logic. However, among philosophers and statisticians the term ‘Bayesian’ is now most closely associated with the subjectivist or personalist account of belief and decision. And the term ‘Bayesian inductive logic’ has come to carry the connotation of a logic that involves purely subjective probabilities. This current usage is misleading since for inductive logics the Bayesian/non-Bayesian distinction should really hang on whether the logic gives Bayes' theorem a prominent role, or whether the logic largely eschews the use of Bayes' theorem in inductive inferences (as do the classical approaches to statistical inference developed by R. A. Fisher (1922) and by Neyman and Pearson (1967)). Indeed, any inductive logic that employs the same probability functions to represent both the probabilities of evidence claims due to hypotheses and the probabilities of hypotheses due to those evidence claims must be a Bayesian inductive logic in this broader sense; because Bayes' theorem follows directly from the axioms that each probability function must satisfy, and Bayes' theorem expresses a necessary connection between the probabilities of evidence claims due to hypotheses and the probabilities of hypotheses due to those evidence claims.

In this article the probabilistic inductive logic we will examine is a Bayesian inductive logic in the broader sense. This logic will not presuppose the subjectivist Bayesian theory of belief and decision, and will avoid the objectionable features of Bayesian logicism. Later we will see that there are good reasons to distinguish inductive probabilities from Bayesian degree-of-belief probabilities and from purely logical probabilities. So, the probabilistic logic articulated in this article will be presented in a way that depends on neither of these conceptions of what the probability functions are. However, this version of the logic will be general enough that it may be fitted to a Bayesian subjectivist or Bayesian logicist program, if one desires to do that.

An inductive logic must, it seems, deviate from this paradigm in several significant ways. For one thing, logical entailment is an absolute, all-or-nothing relationship between sentences, whereas inductive support comes in degrees of strength. For another, although the notion of inductive support is analogous to the deductive notion of logical entailment, and is arguably an extension of it, there seems to be no inductive logic extension of the notion of logical inconsistency—at least none that is inter-definable with inductive support in the way that logical inconsistency is inter-definable with logical entailment. That is, B logically entails A just when (B·~A) is logically inconsistent. However, it turns out that when the unconditional probability of (B·~A) is very nearly 0 (i.e., when (B·~A) is “nearly inconsistent”), the degree to which B inductively supports A, P[A | B], may range anywhere between 0 and 1.

Another notable difference is that when B logically entails A, adding a premise C cannot undermine the entailment—i.e., (C·B) must entail A as well. This property of logical entailment is called monotonicity. But inductive support is nonmonotonic. In general, depending on what A, B, and C mean, adding a premise C to B may substantially raise the degree of support for A, or may substantially lower it, or may leave it completely unchanged—i.e., P[A | C·B] may have a value much larger than P[A | B], or a much smaller value, or it may have the same, or nearly the same value as P[A | B].

In a formal treatment of probabilistic inductive logic, inductive support is represented by conditional probability functions defined on sentences of a formal language L. These conditional probability functions are constrained by certain rules or axioms that are sensitive to the meanings of the logical terms (i.e., ‘not’, ‘and’, ‘or’, etc., the quantifiers ‘all’ and ‘some’, and the identity relation). The axioms apply without regard for what the other terms of the language may mean. In essence the axioms specify a family of possible support functions, {P_β, P_γ, … , P_δ, …} for a given language L. Although each support function satisfies these same axioms, the further issue of which among them provides an appropriate measure of inductive support is not settled by the axioms alone. That may depend on additional factors, such as the meanings of the non-logical terms in the language.

A good way to specify the rules or axioms of the logic of inductive support functions is as follows. Let L be a language for predicate logic with identity, and let ‘⊨’ be the standard logical entailment relation—i.e. the expression ‘B⊨A’ says “B logically entails A” and the expression ‘⊨A’ says “A is a tautology”.

A support function is a function P_α from pairs of sentences of L to real numbers between 0 and 1 that satisfies the following rules or axioms:

1. P_α[D | E] < 1 for at least one pair of sentences D and E.

For all sentence A, B, and C,

2. If B ⊨ A, then P_α[A | B] =1;
3. If ⊨ (B≡C), then P_α[A | B] = P_α[A | C];
4. If C ⊨ ~(B·A), then P_α[(A ∨ B) | C] = P_α[A | C] + P_α[B | C] or P_α[D | C] = 1 for every D;
5. P_α[(A·B) | C] = P_α[A | (B·C)] × P_α[B | C].

This axiomatization takes conditional probability as basic, as seems appropriate for evidential support functions. These functions agree with the usual unconditional probability functions when the latter are defined—just let P_α[A] = P_α[A | (D ∨~D)]. However, these axioms permit conditional probabilities P_α[A | C] to remain defined even when condition statement C has probability 0 (i.e., even when P_α[C | (D∨~D)] = 0).

Notice that conditional probability functions apply only to pairs of sentences, a conclusion sentence and a premise sentence. So in probabilistic inductive logic we represent finite collections of premises by conjoining them into a single sentence. Rather than say, ‘A is supported to degree r by the set of premises {B₁, B₂, B₃,…,B_n}’, we say ‘A is supported to degree r by the premise (…((B₁·B₂)·B₃)·…·B_n)’, and write this as ‘P[A | (…((B₁·B₂)·B₃)·…·B_n)] = r’.

Let us briefly consider each axiom, 1-5, to see how plausible it is as a constraint on a quantitative measure of inductive support, and how it extends the notion of deductive entailment. First, notice that adopting an inductive support scale between 0 and 1 is merely a convenience. This scale is usual for probabilities; but any other scale might do as well.

Rule (1) is a non-triviality requirement. It says that at least one sentence must be supported by another to degree less than 1. We might instead have required that P_α[(A·~A) | (A∨~A)] < 1; but this turns out to be derivable from Rule (1) together with the other rules.

Each degree-of-support function P_α on L measures support strength with numerical values between 0 and 1, with maximal support at 1. When B logically entail A, the support of A based on B is maximal. This is what Rule (2) asserts. It comports with the idea that an inductive support function is a generalization of the deductive entailment relation.

Rule (3) is equally obvious. It says that whenever B is logically equivalent to C, as premises each must provide precisely the same amount of support to every conclusion.

Rule (4) says that inductive support “adds up” in a plausible way. When C logically entails the incompatibility of A and B, the support C provides each separately must sum to the support it provides for their disjunction. The only exception is in cases where C acts like a contradiction and supports all sentences to degree 1.

To understand what Rule (5) says, think of a support function P_α as describing a measure on possible worlds or possible states of affairs. ‘P_α[C | D] = r’ says that the proportion of worlds in which C is true among those where D is true is r. Rule (5) then says the following: if A is true in fraction r of worlds where B and C are true together, and if B (together with C) is true in proportion q of all the C-worlds, then A and B (and C) should be true together in fraction r of that proportion q of B (and C) worlds among the C-worlds.^[2]

From these five rules all of the usual theorems of probability theory are easily derived. For example, logically equivalent sentences are always supported to the same degree: if C ⊨ (B≡A), then P_α[A | C] = P_α[B | C]. The following generalizations of the Addition Rule (4) may be proved as well:

P_α[(A∨B) | C] = P_α[A | C] + P_α[B | C] − P_α[(A·B) | C].

If {B₁, …, B_n} is any finite set of sentences such that for each pair B_i and B_j, C ⊨ ~(B_i·B_j) (i.e., the members of the set are mutually exclusive, given C), then

Pα[((B1∨ B2)∨…∨Bn) | C]  =

n ∑ i=1

Pα[Bi | C],

unless P_α[D | C] = 1 for every sentence D.

If {B₁, …, B_n, …} is any countably infinite set of sentences such that for each pair B_i and B_j, C ⊨ ~(B_i·B_j), then

limn Pα[((B1∨ B2)∨…∨Bn) | C]  =

∞ ∑ i=1

Pα[Bi | C],

unless P_α[D | C] = 1 for every sentence D.^[3]

In the context of inductive logic it makes good sense to supplement the above rules with two additional rules. One is this:

6. If A is an axiom of set theory or any other piece of pure mathematics employed by the sciences, or if A is analytically truth (given the meanings of terms in L associated with support function P_α), then, for all C, P_α[A | C] = 1.

The idea is that inductive logic is about evidential support for contingent claims. Nothing can count as empirical evidence against non-contingent truths. They should be maximally supported by all claims C.

One important respect in which inductive logic should follow the deductive paradigm is in not presupposing the truth-values of contingent sentences. No inductive support function P_α should permit a tautological premise to assign degree of support 1 to a contingent claim—i.e., P_α[C | (B ∨~B)] should always be less than 1 when C is contingent. For, the whole idea of inductive logic is to provide a measure of the extent to which contingent premise sentences indicate the likely truth-values of contingent conclusion sentences. This idea won't work properly if the truth-values of some contingent sentences are presupposed. Such presuppositions would make inductive logic enthymematic. It may hide significant premises in inductive support relationships.

However, it is common practice for probabilistic logicians to sweep provisionally accepted contingent claims under the rug by assigning them probability 1. This saves the trouble of repeatedly writing a given contingent sentence B as a premise, since P_γ[A | B·C] will just equal P_γ[A | C] whenever P_γ[B | C] = 1. Although this device is useful, such probability functions should be considered mere abbreviations of proper, logically explicit, non-enthymematic, inductive support functions. Thus, properly speaking, an inductive support function P_α should not assign probability 1 to a sentence relative to all possible premises unless that sentence is either (i) logically true, or (ii) an axiom of set theory or some other piece of pure mathematics employed by the sciences, or (iii) unless according to the interpretation of the language that P_α presupposes, the sentence is analytic, and so outside the realm of evidential support. Thus, we adopt the following version of the so-called “axiom of regularity”.

7. If, for all C, P_α[A | C] = 1, then A is a logical truth or an axiom of set theory or some other piece of pure mathematics employed by the sciences, or A is analytically true (according to the meanings of the terms of L as represented in P_α).

This is more a convention than an axiom. Taken together with (6) it tells us that a support function P_α counts as non-contingently true just those sentences that it assigns probability 1 on every premise.

Some Bayesian logicists (e.g. Carnap) thought that inductive logic might be made to depend solely on the logical form of sentences, just like deductive logic. The idea was, effectively, to supplement axioms 1–7 with additional axioms that depend only on the logical structures of sentences, and to introduce enough such axioms to reduce the number of possible support functions to a single uniquely best confirmation function. It is now widely agreed that this project cannot be carried out in a plausible way. Perhaps there are additional rules that should be added to 1–7. But it is doubtful such rules can suffice to specify a single, uniquely qualified support function based only on logical structure. We will se why in Section 3, but only after first seeing how inductive probabilities capture the relationship between hypotheses and evidence.

One reading is to take each P_α as a measure on possible worlds, or possible states of affairs. The idea is that, given a fully meaningful language (and, perhaps relative to the inferential inclinations of a particular agent, α) ‘P_α[A | B] = r’ says that among the worlds in which B is true, A is true in proportion r of them. There will generally not be a single privileged way to define such a measure on possible worlds. Rather, it may be that each of a number of functions P_α, P_β, P_γ, …, etc., satisfying the constraints imposed by axioms 1-7 can represent a viable measure of the inferential import of propositions expressed by sentences of the language. This idea needs more fleshing out, of course. The next section will give some indication of how that might go.

Subjectivist Bayesians offer an alternative reading of the support functions. First, they usually take unconditional probability as basic, and they take conditional probabilities as defined in terms of them: the conditional probability ‘P_α[A | B]’ is defined as a ratio of unconditional probabilities, P_α[A·B]/P_α[B]. Subjectivist Bayesians take each unconditional probability function P_α to represent the belief-strengths or confidence-strengths of an ideally rational agent, α. On this understanding ‘P_α[A] =r’ says, “the strength of α's belief (or confidence) that A is truth is r.” Subjectivist Bayesians usually tie such belief strengths to what the agent would be willing to bet on A turning out to be true. Roughly, the idea is this. Suppose that an ideally rational agent α would be willing to accept a wager that would yield (no less than) $u if A turns out to be true and would lose him $1 if A turns out to be false. Then, under reasonable assumptions about how much he desires money, it can be shown that his belief strength that A is true should be P_α[A] = 1/(u+1). And it can further be shown that any function P_α that expresses such betting-related belief-strengths on all statements in agent α's language must satisfy axioms for unconditional probabilities analogous to axioms 1–5. ^[4] Moreover, it can be shown that any function P_β that satisfies these axioms is a possible rational belief function for some ideally rational agent β. These relationships between belief-strengths and the desirability of outcomes (e.g., gaining money or goods on bets) are at the core of subjectivist Bayesian decision theory. Subjectivist Bayesians usually take inductive probability to just be this notion of probabilistic belief-strength.

Undoubtedly real agents do believe some claims more strongly than others. And, arguably, the belief strengths of real agents can be measured on a probabilistic scale between 0 and 1, at least approximately. And clearly the inductive support of evidence for hypotheses should influence the strength of an agent's belief in those hypotheses. However, there is good reason for caution about viewing inductive support functions as Bayesian belief-strength functions, as we will see a bit later. So, perhaps an agent's support function is not simply identical to his belief function, and perhaps the relationship between inductive support and belief-strength is somewhat more complicated.

In any case, some account of what support functions are supposed to represent is clearly needed. The belief function account and the possible worlds account are two attempts to provide this. Let us put this interpretative issue aside for now. One may be able to get a better handle on what inductive support functions really are after one sees how the inductive logic that draws on them is supposed to work.

Consider some exhaustive set of mutually incompatible hypotheses or theories about some subject matter, {h₁, h₂, …}. The set of alternatives may be very simple, e.g., {“the patient has HIV”, “the patient is free of HIV”}. Or, when the physician is trying to determine which among a range of diseases is causing the patient's symptoms, the alternative hypotheses may consist of a long list of possible diseases. For the cosmologist the alternatives may be a list of several alternative gravitational theories, or several versions of the “same theory“. Where inductive logic is concerned, even a slightly different version of a given theory will count as a distinct theory if it differs from the original in empirical import. (This should not be confused with the converse claim, which is the positivistic assertion that theories with the same empirical content are really the same theory. Inductive logic doesn't require you to buy that!)

In general there may be finitely or infinitely many such alternatives under consideration. They may all be considered at once, or they may be constructed and compared over a long historical period. One may even think of the set of alternative hypotheses as consisting of all logically possible alternatives expressible in a given language about a given subject matter—e.g., all possible theories of the origin and evolution of the universe expressible in English and mathematics. Although testing every possible alternative may pose practical challenges, it turns out that the logic works much the same way in the logically ideal case as it does in realistic cases.

If the set of alternative hypotheses is finite, it may contain a catch-all hypothesis h_K that says that none of the other hypotheses are true (e.g., “none of the other known diseases is present”). When only some number u of explicit alternative hypotheses is under consideration, h_K is just the sentence (~h₁·…·~h_u).

Evidence for scientific hypotheses consists of the results of specific experiments or observations. For a given experiment or observation, let ‘c’ represent a description of the relevant conditions under which it is performed, and let ‘e’ represent a description of the result, the evidential outcome of conditions c.

Scientific hypotheses often require the mediation of background knowledge and auxiliary hypotheses to help them express claims about evidence. Let ‘b’ represent all background and auxilliary hypothese not at issue in the assessment of the hypotheses h_i, but that mediate their implications about evidence. In cases where a hypothesis is deductively related to evidence, either h_i·b·c  ⊨  e or h_i·b·c  ⊨  ~e.

For example, h_i might be the Newtonian Theory of Gravitation. A test of the theory might involve a condition statement c describing the results of some earlier measurements of Jupiter's position, and describing the means by which the next position measurement will be made; the outcome description e states the result of this additional position measurement; and the background information (or auxiliary hypotheses) b might state some already well confirmed theory about the workings and accuracy of the devices used to make the position measurements. Thus, if (c·e) occurs, this may be considered good evidence for h_i, given b, as the hypothetico-deductive account of confirmation maintains. On the other hand, if from h_i·b·c we calculate some outcome incompatible with e, then h_i·b·c  ⊨  ~e. In that case from deductive logic alone we get that b·c·e  ⊨  ~h_i, and h_i is said to be falsified by b·c·e.

Duhem (1906) and Quine (1953) are generally credited with alerting inductive logicians to the importance of auxiliary hypotheses. They point out that scientific hypotheses often make little contact with evidence claims on their own. Rather, most scientific hypotheses only make testable predictions relative to background claims or auxiliary hypotheses that tie them to that evidence. Typically auxiliaries are highly confirmed hypotheses from other scientific domains. They often describe the operating characteristics of various devices (e.g. measuring instruments) used to make observations or conduct experiments. They are usually not at issue in the testing of h_i against its competitors, because h_i and its alternatives usually rely on the same auxiliary hypotheses to tie them to the evidence. But even when an auxiliary hypothesis is already well-confirmed, we cannot simply assume that it is unproblematic, or just known to be true. Rather, the evidential support or refutation of a hypothesis h is relative to whatever auxiliaries and background information (in b) is being supposed. In other contexts the auxiliary hypotheses used to test h_i may themselves be among a collection of alternative hypotheses that are themselves subject to evidential support or refutation. (Furthermore, to the extent that competing hypotheses employ different auxiliary hypotheses in accounting for evidence, the evidence only tests each such hypothesis in conjunction with its distinct auxiliaries against alternative hypotheses packaged with their distinct auxiliaries.) Thus, what counts as a hypothesis to be tested, h_i, and what counts as auxiliary hypotheses and background information, b, and even to some extent what counts as the conditions c for an experiment or observation, will always depend on the epistemic context—on what alternative hypotheses are being tested by the same experiments or observations, and on what claims are being presupposed or held fixed for present purposes, and on what claims are considered to be immediate preconditions for the evidential outcome e. No statement is intrinsically a hypotheis, or intrinsically an auxiliary (or a background condition), or intrinsically an evidential condition. Rather, those are roles statements may play in an epistemic context, and the very same statement may play different roles in different confirmational contexts.

In a probabilistic inductive logic the degree to which evidence c·e supports a hypothesis h_i relative to background b is represented by the posterior probability of h_i, P_α[h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ]. It turns out that the posterior probability of a hypothesis depends on just two kinds of factors: (1) its prior probability, P_α[h_i | b], together with the prior probabilities of its competitors, P_α[h_j | b], etc.; and (2) the likelihood of evidential outcomes e according to h_i, given that b and c are true, P[e | h_i·b·c], together with the likelihoods of outcomes according to its competitors, P[e | h_j·b·c], etc. In this section we will first examine each of these two kinds of factors in some detail, and then see precisely how the values of posterior probabilities depend on them.

A blood test for HIV has a known false-positive rate and a known true-positive rate. Suppose the false positive rate is .05—i.e., the test incorrectly shows the blood sample to be positive for HIV in 5% of all cases where HIV is not present. And suppose the true-positive rate is .99—i.e., the test correctly shows the blood sample to be positive for HIV in 99% of all cases where HIV really is present.When a particular patient's blood is tested, the hypotheses under consideration are ‘the patient is infected with HIV’, h, and ‘the patient is not infected with HIV’, ~h. In this context the known test characteristics function as background information, b. The experimental condition c merely states that this patient was subjected to a blood test for HIV, which was processed by the lab in the usual way. Let us suppose that the outcome e states that the result is positive for HIV. The relevant likelihoods, then, are P[e | h·b·c] = .99 and P[e | ~h·b·c] = .05.

In this example the values of the likelihoods are entirely due to the statistical characteristics of the accuracy of the test, which is carried by the background information b. The hypothesis h being tested is not itself statistical.

This kind of situation may, of course, arise for much more complex hypotheses. The hypothesis of interest may be some deterministic physical theory, say Newtonian Gravitation Theory. Some of the experiments that test this theory relay on somewhat imprecise measurements that have known statistical error characteristics, which are expressed as part of the background or auxiliary hypotheses b. For example, the auxiliary b may describe the error characteristics of a device that measures the torque imparted to a quartz fiber, where the measured torque is used to assess the strength of the gravitational force between test masses. In that case b may say that for this kind of device the measurement errors are normally distributed about whatever value a given gravitational theory predicts, with some specified standard deviation that is characteristic of the device. This results in specific values r_i for the likelihoods, P[e | h_i·b·c] = r_i, for each of the various alternative gravitational theories h_i being tested.

On the other hand, the hypotheses being tested may themselves be statistical in nature. One of the simplest examples of statistical hypotheses and their role in likelihoods are hypotheses about the chance characteristic of coin-tossing. Let h_[r] be a hypothesis that says a specific coin has a propensity r (e.g., 1/2) for coming up heads on normal tosses, and that such tosses are probabilistically independent of one another. Let c state that the coin is tossed n times in the normal way; and let e say that on these tosses the coin comes up heads m times. In cases like this the value of the likelihood of the outcome e on hypothesis h for condition c is given by the well-known binomial term:

P[e | h[r]·b·c] =

n! m! × (n−m)!

× rm (1−r)n−m.

There are, of course, more complex cases of likelihoods involving statistical hypotheses. Consider, for example, the hypothesis that plutonium 233 nuclei have a half-life of 20 minutes—i.e., the propensity for a Pu-233 nucleus to decay within a 20 minute period is 1/2. This hypothesis, h, together with background b about decay products and the efficiency of the equipment used to detect them (which may itself be an auxiliary statistical hypothesis), yields precisely calculable values for likelihoods P[e_k | h·b·c] of possible outcomes of the experimental arrangement.

Likelihoods that arise from explicit statistical claims—either within the hypotheses being tested, or from explicit statistical background claims that tie the hypotheses to the evidence—are often called direct inference likelihoods. Such likelihoods are completely objective. So it seems reasonable to suppose that all support functions should agree on their values, just as all support functions agree on likelihoods when evidence is logically entailed. Direct inference likelihoods are logical in an extended, non-deductive sense. Indeed, some logicians have attempted to spell out the logic of direct inferences in terms of the logical form of the sentences involved.^[6] But regardless of whether that project succeeds, it seems reasonable to take likelihoods of this sort to have highly objective or intersubjectively agreed values.

Not all likelihoods of interest in confirmational contexts are warranted deductively or by explicitly stated statistical claims. Nevertheless, the likelihoods that relate hypotheses to evidence in scientific contexts should often have objective or intersubjectively agreed values. So, although a variety of different support functions P_α, P_β ,…, P_γ, etc., may be needed to represent the differing “inductive proclivities” of the various members of a scientific community, all should agree, at least approximately, on the values of the likelihoods. For, likelihoods represent the empirical content of a hypothesis, what the hypothesis (together with background b) probabilistically implies about the evidence. Thus, the empirical objectivity of a science relies on a high degree of objectivity or intersubjective agreement among scientists on the numerical values of likelihoods.

To see the point more vividly, imagine what a science would be like if scientists disagreed widely about the values of likelihoods. Each practitioner interprets a theory to say quite different things about how likely it is that various possible evidence statements will turn out to be true. Whereas scientist α takes theory h₁ to probabilistically imply that event e is highly likely, his colleague β understands the empirical import of h₁ to say that e is very unlikely. And, conversely, α takes competing theory h₂ to probabilistically imply that e is quite unlikely, whereas β reads h₂ to say that e is very likely. So, for α the evidential outcome e supplies strong support for h₁ over h₂, because P_α[e | h₁·b·c]   >> P_α[e | h₂·b·c]. But his colleague β takes outcome e to show just the opposite—that h₂ is strongly supported over h₁—because P_β[e | h₁·b·c] << P_β[e | h₂·b·c]. If this kind of thing were to occur often or for significant evidence claims in a scientific domain, it would make a shambles of the empirical objectivity of that science. It would completely undermine the empirical testability of its hypotheses and theories. Under such circumstances, although each scientist employs the same theoretical sentences to express a given theory h, each understands the empirical import of these sentences so differently that h as understood by α is an empirically different theory than h as understood by β. Thus, the empirical objectivity of the sciences requires that experts should be in close agreement about the values of the likelihoods.^[7]

For now we will suppose that the likelihoods have objective or intersubjectively agreed values, common to all agents in a scientific community. Let us mark this agreement by dropping the subscript ‘α’, ‘β’, etc., from expressions that represent likelihoods. One might worry that this supposition is overly strong. There are many legitimate scientific contexts where, although scientists should have enough of a common understanding of the empirical import of hypotheses to assign quite similar values to likelihoods, precise agreement on the numerical values is unrealistic. This point is right. So later we will see how to relax the supposition that likelihood values agree precisely. But for now the main ideas behind probabilistic inductive logic will be more easily explained if we focus on those contexts were objective or intersubjectively agreed likelihoods are available. Later we will see that much the same logic continues to apply in contexts where the values of likelihoods may be somewhat vague, or where members of the scientific community disagree to some extent about their values.

An adequate treatment of the likelihoods calls for the introduction of one additional notational device. Scientific hypotheses are generally tested by a sequence of experiments or observations conducted over a period of time. To explicitly represent the accumulation of evidence, let the series of sentences c₁, c₂, …, c_n, describe the conditions under which a sequence of experiments or observations are conducted. And let the corresponding outcomes of these observations be represented by sentences e₁, e₂,…,e_n. We will abbreviate the conjunction of the first n descriptions of experimental or observation conditions as ‘cⁿ’, and abbreviate the conjunction of descriptions of their outcomes as ‘eⁿ’. Then, for a stream of n observations or experiments and their outcomes, the likelihoods take form P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = r, for appropriate r between 0 and 1. In many cases the likelihood of the evidence stream will be equal to the product of the likelihoods of the individual outcomes:

P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = P[e₁ | h_i·b·c₁] ×…× P[e_n | h_i·b·c_n].

When this equality holds the individual bits of evidence are said to be probabilistically independent on the hypothesis. In what follows such independence will only be assumed in those places where it is explicitly invoked.

To understand the role of prior probabilities, consider the HIV test example described in the previous section. What the physician and patient want to know is the value of the posterior probability P_α[h | b·c·e] that the patient has HIV, h, given the evidence of the positive test, c·e, and given the error rates of the test, described within b. The value of this posterior probability depends on the likelihood (due to the error rates) of this patient obtaining a true-positive result, P[e | h·b·c] = .99, and of obtaining a false positive result, P[e | ~h·b·c] = .05. In addition, the value of the of the posterior probability depends on how plausible it is that the patient has HIV before the test results are taken into account, P_α[h | b]. In the context of medical diagnosis this prior probability is sometimes called the base rate. It represents the probability that the patient may have contracted HIV based on his risk group (i.e., whether he is an IV drug user, has unprotected sex with multiple partners, etc.). Such information should be explicitly stated, and represented within b as well. To see its importance, consider the following numerical results (which may be calculated using the formula called Bayes' Theorem, presented in the next section). If the base rate for the patient's risk group is relatively high, say P_α[h | b] = .10, then the positive test result yields a probability for his having HIV of P_α[h | b·c·e] = .69. However, if the patient is in a very low risk group, P_α[h | b] = .001, then a positive test only raises the probability of HIV infection to P_α[h | b·c·e] = .02. This posterior probability is much higher than the prior probability of .001, but should not worry the patient too much. This positive test result is more likely due to the false-positive rate of the test than to the presence of HIV. (This sort of test, with such a large false-positive rate, .05, is best used as a screening test; a positive result should lead to a second, more rigorous, more expensive test.)

In the evidential evaluation of scientific theories, prior probabilities often represent assessments by agents of non-evidential, conceptually motivated plausibility weightings among hypotheses. However, because such plausibility assessments tend to vary among agents, critics often brand them as merely subjective, and take their role in probabilistic induction to be highly problematic. Bayesian inductivists counter that such assessments often play an important role in the sciences, especially when there is insufficient evidence to distinguish among some of the alternative hypotheses. And, they argue, the epithet merely subjective is unwarranted. Such plausibility assessments are often backed by extensive arguments that may draw on forceful conceptual considerations.

Consider, for example, the kind of plausibility arguments that have been brought to bear on the various interpretations of quantum theory (e.g., those related to the measurement problem). These arguments go to the heart of conceptual issues that were central to the development of the theory. Indeed, many of these issues were first raised by the scientists who made the greatest contributions to the theory's development, in the attempt to get a conceptual hold on the theory and its implications. Such arguments seem to play a legitimate role in the assessment of alternative views when distinguishing evidence has yet to be found.

More generally, scientists often bring plausibility arguments to bear in assessing their views. Although such arguments are seldom decisive, they may bring the scientific community into widely shared agreement, especially regarding the implausibility of some logically possible alternatives. This seems to be the primary epistemic role of the thought experiment. Thus, although prior probabilities may be subjective in the sense that agents may disagree on the relative strengths of plausibility arguments—and so disagree on the comparative plausibilities of various hypotheses—the priors used in scientific contexts should not represent mere subjective whims. Rather, they should be supported (or at least be supportable) by explicit arguments regarding how much more plausible one hypothesis is than another. The important role of plausibility assessments is apparent in such received bits of scientific wisdom as the old saw that extraordinary claims require extraordinary evidence. That is, it takes especially strong evidence, in the form of extremely high values for ratios of likelihoods, to overcome the extremely low plausibility values possessed by some hypotheses. We'll see precisely how this idea works in the next section, and return to it again in Section 3.5.

When sufficiently strong evidence becomes available, it turns out that prior plausibility assessments may be “washed out” or overridden by the evidence. We'll see how this works in Sections 4 and 5. Thus, prior plausibility assessments play their most important role when the kind of evidence for which hypotheses specify likelihoods is still fairly sparse. It will be shown that provided the value of the prior probability of a true hypothesis isn't assessed to be zero, as evidence accumulates the influence of the values of the prior probabilities will very probably fade away as evidence accumulates.

Some Bayesian logicists (e.g. Carnap) have maintained that posterior probabilities of hypotheses should be determined by logical form alone. The idea is that the likelihoods might reasonably be specified in terms of logical form; so if logical form might be made to determine the values of prior probabilities as well, then inductive logic would be fully “formal” in the same way that deductive logic is “formal”. Keynes and Carnap tried to implement this idea through syntactic versions of the principle of indifference—the idea that syntactically similar hypotheses should be assigned the same prior probability values. Carnap showed how to carry out this project in detail, but only for extremely simple formal languages. Most logicians now take the project to have failed because of a fatal flaw with the whole idea that reasonable prior probabilities can be made to depend on logical form alone. Semantic content should matter. Goodmanian grue-predicates provide one way to illustrate the point.^[8] Furthermore, as suggested earlier, for this idea to apply to the evidential support of real scientific theories, scientists would have to assess the prior probabilities of each alternative theory based only on its syntactic structure. That seems an unreasonable way to proceed. Are we to evaluate the prior probabilities of alternative theories of gravitation, or of alternative quantum theories, by exploring only their syntactic structures, with absolutely no regard for their semantic content—with no regard for what they say about the world? This seems an extremely dubious approach to the evaluation of real scientific theories. Logical structure alone cannot, and should not suffice for determining reasonable prior probability values for real scientific theories. Moreover, real scientific hypotheses and theories are inevitably subject to plausibility considerations based on what they say about the world. Prior probabilities are much better suited to representating of the weight of such plausibility considerations, vague as they may be..

We will return to prior probabilities in a bit. But first let's see how likelihoods combine with prior probabilities to yield posterior probabilities for hypotheses.

Let's now examine several forms of Bayes' Theorem, each derivable from axioms 1–5. The simplest is this:

Bayes' Theorem: Simple Form

(8)   Pα[hi | b·cn·en]	=	P[en | hi·b·cn] × Pα[hi | b] Pα[en | b·cn] × Pα[cn | hi·b] Pα[cn | b]
	=	P[en | hi·b·cn] × Pα[hi | b] Pα[en | b·cn] if Pα[cn | hi·b] = Pα[cn | b].

This equation expresses the posterior probability of h_i, P_α[h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ], in terms of the likelihood of the evidence on the hypothesis (together with background and observation conditions), P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ], the prior probability of the hypothesis (given background conditions), P_α[h_i | b], and the simple probability of the evidence (given background and observation conditions), P_α[eⁿ | b·cⁿ]. This latter probability is sometimes called the expectedness of the evidence.

This version of Bayes' Theorem also includes a term, (P_α[cⁿ | h_i·b] / P_α[cⁿ | b]), that represents the ratio of the likelihood of the experimental conditions on the hypothesis and background to the “likelihood” of the experimental conditions on the background alone. Bayes' Theorem is usually expressed in a way that suppresses this factor by building cⁿ into the background b. However, if cⁿ is built into b, then technically b must change as new evidence is accumulated. So it is better to make this factor explicit and see how to deal with it logically. Arguably the term (P_α[cⁿ | h_i·b] / P_α[cⁿ | b]) should be 1, or be very near 1, since the truth of the hypothesis at issue should not significantly affect how likely it is that the experimental conditions are satisfied. If various alternative hypotheses assign significantly different likelihoods to the experimental conditions, then such conditions should more properly be included in the evidential outcomes eⁿ.

Both the prior probability of the hypothesis and the expectedness tend to be somewhat subjective factors in that various agents from the same scientific community may legitimately disagree on what values these factors should take. Bayesian logicians usually accept the subjectivity of the prior probabilities of hypotheses, but find the subjectivity of the expectedness to be more troubling. This is due at least in part to the the fact that in a Bayesian logic of evidential support the value of the expectedness cannot be independendent of likelihoods and the prior probabilities of hypotheses. That is, when for each member of a set of alternative hypotheses the likelihood P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] has an objective (or intersubjectively agreed) value, the expectedness is constrained by the following equation (where the sum ranges over a mutually exclusive and exhaustive set of alternative hypotheses {h₁, h₂, …, h_m, …}, which may be finite or infinite):

P_α[eⁿ | b·cⁿ]  =  ∑_j P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] × P_α[h_j | b·cⁿ]
        =  ∑_j P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] × P_α[h_j | b]
        if cⁿ is irrelevant to each hypothesis h_j given b.

The first line implies that the value of the expectedness must at least lie between the largest and smallest of the various likelihood values based on specific hypotheses. The second line shows that the values for the prior probabilities together with the values of the likelihoods should uniquely determine the value for the expectedness of the evidence. This result reflects the intuitive idea that, according to an evidential support function, evidence claims are not "simply likely" to a certain degree on their own, independently of what any hypothesis has to say. Rather, the likelihoods of evidence claims are most fundamentally fixed relative to relevant hypotheses. Furthermore, the expectedness can only be calculated in this way in cases where every alternative hypothesis to h_i already figured out. Otherwise, although the expectednessis constrained in principle, but there is no way to figure out what its value should be.

However, this troublesome expectedness of the evidence term is easily sidestepped.

The subjective expectedness term may be circumvented by considering a ratio form of Bayes' Theorem, a form that compares hypotheses one pair at a time:

Bayes' Theorem: Ratio Form

(9)	Pα[hj | b·cn·en] Pα[hi | b·cn·en]	=	P[en | hj·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn] × Pα[hj | b] Pα[hi | b] × Pα[cn | hj·b] Pα[cn | hi·b]
		=	P[en | hj·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn] × Pα[hj | b] Pα[hi | b]  if Pα[cn | hj·b] Pα[cn | hi·b]  = 1
		=	P[e1 | hj·b·c1] P[e1 | hi·b·c1] ×…× P[en | hj·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn] × Pα[hj | b] Pα[hi | b]

if P_α[cⁿ | h_j·b] / P_α[cⁿ | h_i·b] = 1 and relative to each hypothesis the evidential events are probabilistic independent of one another.

The condition ‘P_α[cⁿ | h_j·b] / P_α[cⁿ | h_i·b] = 1’ says that cⁿ is no more likely on h_i·b than on h_j·b—i.e., that neither hypothesis makes the occurrence of experimental or observation conditions more likely than the other.^[9]

This Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem expresses how much more plausible, on the evidence, one hypothesis is than another. Notice that the likelihood ratios carry the full import of the evidence. The evidence influences the evaluation of hypotheses in no other way. Alsi notice that the only element affecting the ratio of posterior probabilities that may not be fully objectively determinate is the ratio of prior probabilities.

This version of Bayes's Theorem shows that to evaluate the posterior probability ratios of hypotheses, the prior probabilities of hypotheses need not be evaluated absolutely; only their ratios are needed. That is, with regard to the priors, the Bayesian evaluation of hypotheses only relies on how much more plausible one hypothesis is than another (due to the considerations expressed within b). The Bayesian evaluation of hypotheses is essentially comparative in that only ratios of likelihoods and ratios of prior probabilities are ever really needed for the assessment of scientific hypotheses. Furthermore, we will soon see that the absolute values of the posterior probabilities entirely derive from the posterior probability ratios provided by the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem.

Let's consider a simple example of how the Ratio Form of the theorem is utilized. Suppose we possess a warped coin and want to determine its propensity for heads when tossed in the usual way. We may compare two hypotheses, h_[q] and h_[r], that propose that the propensity for the coin to come up heads on the usual kind of toss is q and r, respectively. Let cⁿ report that the coin is tossed n times in the normal way, and let eⁿ report a total m heads. Supposing that the outcomes of tosses are probabilistically independent relative to each of the two hypotheses, line 3 of Equation (9) yields the following equation, where the likelihood ratio is the ratio of the respective binomial terms:

Pα[h[q] | b·cn·en] Pα[h[r] | b·cn·en]

=

qm (1−q)n−m rm (1−r)n−m

×

Pα[h[q] | b] Pα[h[r] | b]

When, for instance, the coin is tossed n = 100 times and comes up heads m = 72 times, the evidence for hypothesis h_[1/2] as compared to h_[3/4] is given by the likelihood ratio [(1/2)⁷²(1/2)²⁸]/[(3/4)⁷²(1/4)²⁸] = .000056269. So, even if prior to the evidence, plausibility considerations (expressed within b) make it 100 times more plausible that the coin is fair than that it is warped towards heads with propensity 3/4—i.e., even if P_α[h_[1/2] | b] / P_α[h_[3/4] | b] = 100—the evidence provided by these tosses makes the posterior plausibility that the coin is fair only about 6/1000^th as plausible as the hypothesis that it is warped towards heads with propensity 3/4—i.e., P_α[h_[1/2] | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] / P_α[h_[3/4] | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] = .0056269. Thus, such evidence strongly refutes the “fairness hypothesis” relative to the “3/4-heads-propensity hypothesis”, provided the assessment of prior probabilities (i.e. prior plausibilities) doesn't make the latter hypothesis too extremely implausible to begin with. Notice, however, that strong refutation is not absolute refutation. Additional evidence could reverse the trend towards the strong refutation of the “fairness hypothesis”.

This example employs repetitions of the same kind of experiment—repeated tosses of a coin. But the point holds more generally. If, as the evidence increases, the likelihood ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] approach 0, then the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem, Equation 9, shows that the posterior probability of h_j must approach 0 as well. The evidence comes to strongly refute h_j with little regard for its prior plausibility value. Indeed, Bayesian induction turns out to be a version of eliminative induction, and Equation 9 begins to illustrate this. For, suppose that h_i is the true hypothesis, and consider what happens to each of its false competitors, h_j. If enough evidence becomes available to drive each of the likelihood ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] toward 0 (as n increases), then Equation 9 says that each false h_j will become effectively refuted—each of their posterior probabilities approaches 0. As a result, the posterior probability of h_i must approach 1. The next two equations show precisely how this works.

If we sum the ratio versions of Bayes' Theorem in Equation 9 over all alternatives to hypothesis h_i (including the catch-all h_K, if we need one), we get the Odds Form of Bayes' Theorem. The odds against A given B is defined as Ω_α[~A | B] = P_α[~A | B] / P_α[A | B]. So, we have:

Bayes' Theorem: The Odds Form

(10)  Ωα[~hi | b·cn·en]  =	∑ j≠i	Pα[hj | b·cn·en] Pα[hi | b·cn·en]	+	Pα[hK | b·cn·en] Pα[hi | b·cn·en]
=	∑ j≠i	P[en | hj·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn]	×	Pα[hj | b] Pα[hi | b]
	+	Pα[en | hK·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn]	×	Pα[hK | b] Pα[hi | b]

where the factor following the ‘+’ sign is only required in cases where a catch-all alternative hypothesis, h_K, is needed.

Notice that if a catch-all hypothesis is needed, the likelihood of evidence relative to it will not generally enjoy the same kind of objectivity as the likelihoods for specific, positive hypotheses. We leave the subscript α on the likelihood for the catch-all to indicate this lack of objectivity.

Although the catch-all hypothesis may lack objective likelihoods, the influence of the catch-all term in Bayes' theorem diminishes as additional positive hypotheses are articulated. That is, as new hypotheses are discovered they are “peeled off” of the catch-all. So, when a new hypothesis h_u+1 is formulated and made explicit, the old catch-all h_K is replaced by a new catch-all, h_K*, of form (~h₁·…·~h_u·~h_u+1); and the prior probability for the new catch-all hypothesis is gotten by diminishing the prior of the old catch-all: P_α[h_K* | b] = P_α[h_K | b]  − P_α[h_u+1 | b]. Thus, the influence of the catch-all term should diminish towards 0 as new alternative hypotheses are made explicit.^[10]

If increasing evidence drives the likelihood ratios comparing h_i with each competitor towards 0, then the odds against h_i, Ω_α[~h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ], will approach 0 (provided that priors of catch-all terms, if needed, approach 0 as well as new alternative hypotheses are made explicit and peeled off). And, as Ω_α[~h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] approaches 0, the posterior probability of h_i goes to 1. The relationship between the odds against h_i and its posterior probability is this:

Bayes' Theorem: General Probabilistic Form

(11)    P_α[h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ]  =  1 / (1 + Ω_α[~h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ]).

The odds against a hypothesis depends only on the values of ratios of posterior probabilities, which entirely derive from the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem. Thus we see that the individual value of the posterior probability of a hypothesis depends only on the ratios of posterior probabilities, which come from the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem. Thus, the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem completely captures the essential features of the Bayesian evaluation of hypothesis. It shows how the impact of evidence (in the form of likelihood ratios) combines with comparative plausibility assessments of hypotheses (in the form of ratios of prior probabilities) to provide a net assessment of the extent to which hypotheses are refuted or supported via contests with their rivals.

There is a result, a kind of Bayesian Convergence Theorem, that shows that if h_i (together with b·cⁿ) is true, then the likelihood ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] comparing evidentially distinguishable alternative hypothesis h_j to h_i will very probably approach 0 as evidence accumulates (i.e., as n increases). Let's call this result the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem. When this theorem applies, Equation 9 shows that the posterior probability of false competitor h_j will very probably approach 0 as evidence accumulates, regardless of the value of its prior probability P_α[h_j | b]. As this happens to each of h_i's false competitors, Equations 10 and 11 say that the posterior probability of the true hypothesis, h_i, will approach 1 as evidence increases.^[11] Thus, Bayesian induction is at bottom a version of induction by elimination, where the elimination of alternatives comes by way of likelihood ratios approaching 0 as evidence accumulates. We will examine the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem in detail in Section 5.^[12]

For more on Bayes' Theorem see the entries on Bayes' Theorem and on Bayesian epistemology in this Encyclopedia.

General Law of Likelihood:
Given any pair of incompatible hypotheses h_i and h_j, whenever the likelihoods P_α[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] and P_α[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] are defined, the evidence (cⁿ·eⁿ) supports h_i over h_j, given b, if and only if P_α[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ]  > P_α[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]. The ratio of likelihoods P_α[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] / P_α[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] measures the strength of the evidence for h_i over h_j given b.

Two features of this law require some explanation. As stated, the General Law of Likelihood does not presuppose that likelihoods of form P_α[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] and P_α[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] are always defined. This qualification is introduced to accommodate a conception of evidential support called Likelihoodism, which is especially influential among statisticians. Also, the likelihoods in the law are expressed with the subscript α attached to indicate that the law holds for each inductive support function P_α, even when the values of the likelihoods are not objective or agreed on by all agents in a given scientific community. These two features of the law are closely related, as we will see.

Each probabilistic support function satisfies the axioms of Section 2. According to these axioms the conditional probability of one sentence on another is always defined. So, in the context of the inductive logic of support functions the likelihoods are always defined, and the qualifying clause about this in the General Law of Likelihood is automatically satisfied. For inductive support functions, all of the versions of Bayes' theorem (Equations 8-11) continue to hold even when the likelihoods are not objective or intersubjectively agreed on by the scientific community. In many scientific contexts there will be general agreement on the values of likelihoods; but whenever such agreement fails the subscripts α, β, etc. must remain attached to the support function likelihoods to indicate this. Even so, the General Law of Likelihood continues to hold for each support function.

There is a view, or family of views, called likelihoodism that maintains that the inductive logician or statistician should only be concerned with whether the evidence provides increased or decreased support for one hypothesis over another, and only in cases where this evaluation is based on the ratios of completely objective likelihoods. (Prominent likelihoodists include Edwards (1972) and Royall (1997); also see Forster and Sober (2004) and Fitelson (2007).) When the likelihoods involved are objective, the ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[e ⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] provide a pure, objective measure of how strongly the evidence supports h_i as compared to h_j, a measure that is “untainted” by prior plausibility considerations. According to likelihoodists, only this kind of pure measure is scientifically appropriate for the assessment of how evidence impacts hypotheses. (It should be noted that the classical school of statistics, assocoated with R.A. Fisher (1922) and with Neyman and Pearson (1967), reject the claim about the nature of evidential support expressed by the General Law of Likelihood.)

Likelihoodists maintain that it is not appropriate for statisticians to incorporate assumptions about prior probabilities of hypotheses into the assessment of evidential support. It is not their place to compute recommended values of posterior probabilities for the scientific community. When the results of experiments are made public, say in scientific journals, only objective likelihoods should be reported. The evaluation of the impact of objective likelihoods on agents' posterior probabilities depends on each agent's individual subjective prior probability, which represents plausibility considerations that have nothing to do with the evidence. So, likelihoodists suggest, posterior probabilities should be left for individuals to compute (if they desire to do so).

The conditional probabilities between most pairs of sentences fail to be objectively defined in a way that suits likelihoodists. So, for likelihoodists, the general logic of support functions (captured by the axioms of Section 2) cannot represent an objective logic of evidential support for hypotheses. Because they eschew the logic of support functions, likelihoodist do not have Bayes' theorem available, and so cannot derive the Law of Likelihood from it. Rather, they must state the Law of Likelihood as an axiom of their inductive logic, an axiom that applies only when the likelihoods have well-defined objective values.

Likelihoodists tend to have a very strict conception of what it takes for likelihoods to be well-defined. They consider a likelihood to be well-defined only when it is (what we referred to earlier as) a direct inference likelihood— i.e., only when either, (1) the hypothesis (together with background and experimental conditions) logically entails the data, or (2) the hypothesis (together with background) logically entails an explicit simple statistical hypothesis that (together with experimental conditions) specifies precise probabilities for each of the events that make up the evidence.

Likelihoodists contrast simple statistical hypotheses with composite statistical hypotheses, which only entail vague, or imprecise, or directional claims about the statistical probabilities of evidential events. Whereas a simple statistical hypothesis might say, for example, “the chance of heads on tosses of the coin is precisely .65”, a composite statistical hypothesis might say, “the chance of heads on tosses is either .65 or .75,” or it may be a directional hypothesis that says, “the chance of heads on tosses is greater than .65.” Likelihoodists maintain that composite hypotheses are not an appropriate basis for well-defined likelihoods. Such hypotheses represent a kind of disjunction of simple statistical hypotheses. The direction hypothesis, for instance, is essentially a disjunction of the various simple statistical hypotheses that assign specific values above .65 to the chances of heads on tosses. Likelihoods based on such hypotheses are not appropriately objective by the lights of the likelihoodist because they must in effect depend on factors that represent the degree to which the composite hypothesis supports each of the simple statistical hypotheses that it encompasses; and likelihoodists consider such factors too subjective to be permitted in a logic that should permit only objective likelihoods.^[13]

Taking all of this into account, the version of the Law of Likelihood appropriate to likelihoodists may be stated as follows.

Special Law of Likelihood:
Given a pair of incompatible hypotheses h_i and h_j that imply simple statistical models regarding outcomes eⁿ given (b·cⁿ), the likelihoods P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] and P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] are well defined. For such likelihoods, the evidence (cⁿ·eⁿ) supports h_i over h_j, given b, if and only if P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] > P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]; the ratio of likelihoods P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] measures the strength of the evidence for h_i over h_j given b.

Notice that when either version of the Law of Likelihood holds, the absolute size of a likelihood is irrelevant to the strength of the evidence. All that matters is the relative size of the likelihoods for one hypothesis as compared to another. That is, let c₁ and c₂ be the conditions for two distinct experiments having outcomes e₁ and e₂, respectively. Suppose that e₁ is 1000 times more likely on h_i (given b·c₁) than is e₂ on h_i (given b·c₂); and suppose that e₁ is also 1000 times more likely on h_j (given b·c₁) than is e₂ on h_j (given b·c₂)—i.e., suppose that P_α[e₁ | h_i·b·c₁] = 1000 × P_α[e₂ | h_i·b·c₁], and P_α[e₁ | h_j·b·c₁]  =  1000 × P_α[e₂ | h_j·b·c₂]. Which piece of evidence, (c₁·e₁) or (c₂·e₂), is stronger evidence with regard to the comparison of h_i to h_j? The Law of Likelihood implies both are equally strong. All that matters evidentially are the ratios of the likelihoods, and they are the same: P_α[e₁ | h_i·b·c₁] / P_α[e₁ | h_j·b·c₁] = P_α[e₂ | h_i·b·c₂] / P_α[e₂ | h_j·b·c₂]. Thus, the General Law of Likelihood implies the following principle.

General Likelihood Principle:
Suppose two different experiments or observations (or two sequences of them) c₁ and c₂ produce outcomes e₁ and e₂, respectively. Let { h₁, h₂, …} be any set of alternative hypotheses. If there is a constant K such that for each hypothesis h_j from the set, P_α[e₁ | h_j·b·c₁] = K × P_α[e₂ | h_j·b·c₂], then the evidential import of (c₁·e₁) for distinguishing among hypotheses in the set (given b) is precisely the same as the evidential import of (c₂·e₂).

Similarly, the Special Law of Likelihood implies a corresponding Special Likelihood Principle that applies only to hypotheses that express simple statistical models.^[14]

Throughout the remainder of this article we will not assume that likelihoods must be based on simple statistical hypotheses, as likelihoodist would have them. However, most of what will be said about likelihoods, especially the convergence result in Section 5, applies to likelihoodist likelihoods as well. We will, however, continue to suppose that likelihoods are objective in the sense that all members of the scientific community agree on their numerical values. In Section 6 we will see how even this supposition may be relaxed in scientific contexts where completely objective values for likelihoods are not realistically available.

3.5 On Prior Probability Assessments—and Representations of Vague and Diverse Plausibility Assessments

Given that a scientific community should largely agree on the values of the likelihoods, any significant disagreement among them with regard to the values of posterior probabilities of hypotheses should derive from disagreements over their assessments of values for the prior probabilities of those hypotheses. We saw in section 3.3 that the Bayesian logic of evidential support need only rely on assessments of ratios of prior probabilities—on how much more plausible one hypothesis is than another. Furthermore, presumably, in scientific contexts the comparative plausibility values for hypotheses should depend on explicit plausibility arguments (stated within b), not on privately help opinions. (It would be highly unscientific for a member of the scientific community to disregard or dismiss a hypothesis that other members take to be a reasonable proposal with only the comment: “don't ask me to give reasons, it's just my opinion”.) Even so, agents may be unable to specify precisely how much more strongly the available plausibility arguments support a hypothesis over an alternative; so prior probability ratios for hypotheses may be vague. Furthermore, agents in a scientific community may disagree about how strongly the available plausibility arguments support a hypothesis over a rival hypothesis; so prior probability ratios may be somewhat diverse as well.

Both the vagueness of prior plausibility ratio values for individual agents and the diversity of values among the community of agents can be represented formally by sets of probabilistic support functions, {P_α, P_β, …}, that agree on the values for the likelihoods but encompass a range of values for the (ratios of) prior probabilities of hypotheses. Vagueness and diversity are somewhat different issues, but they may be represented in much the same way. Let's consider each in turn.

Assessments of the prior plausibilities of hypotheses will often be vague—not subject to the kind of precise quantitative treatment that a Bayesian version of probabilistic inductive logic may seem to require for prior probabilities. So, it is sometimes objected, the kind of assessment of prior probabilities required to get the Bayesian algorithm going cannot be accomplished in practice. To see how Bayesian inductivists address this worry, first recall the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem, equation (9).

Pα[hj | b·cn·en] Pα[hi | b·cn·en]

=

P[en | hj·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn]

×

Pα[hj | b] Pα[hi | b]

Recall that this Ratio Form of the theorem captures the essential features of the logic of evidential support, even though it only provides a value for the ratio of the posterior probabilities. (We'll see why this is so in more detail in a moment.)

Notice that the ratio form of the theorem easily accommodates situations where we don't have precise numerical values for prior probabilities. It only depends on our ability to assess how much more or less plausible alternative hypothesis h_j is than hypothesis h_i—only the value of the ratio P_α[h_j | b] / P_α[h_i | b] need be assessed; the values of the individual prior probabilities are not required. Such comparative plausibilities are much easier to assess than specific numerical prior plausibility values for individual hypotheses. When combined with the ratio of likelihoods, this ratio of priors suffices to yield an assessment of the ratio of posterior plausibilities, P_α[h_j | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] / P_α[h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ].

Although such posterior ratios don't supply values for the individual posterior probabilities, they place a crucial constraint on the posterior support of hypothesis h_j, since

Pα[hj | b·cn·en] <

Pα[hj | b·cn·en] Pα[hi | b·cn·en]

=

P[en | hj·b·cn] P[en | hi·b·cn]

×

Pα[hj | b] Pα[hi | b]

This Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem tolerates a good deal of vagueness or imprecision in assessments of the ratios of prior probabilities. In practice one need only assess bounds for these prior plausibility ratios to achieve meaningful results. Given a prior ratio in a specific interval,

q ≤ P_α[h_j | b] / P_α[h_i | b] ≤ r

a likelihood ratio P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = LRⁿ results in a posterior confirmation ratio in the interval

(LRⁿ×q) ≤ P_α[h_j | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] / P_α[h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] ≤ (LRⁿ×r).

Technically each probabilistic support function assigns a specific numerical value to each pair of sentences; so when we write an inequality like ‘q ≤ P_α[h_j | b] / P_α[h_i | b] ≤ r’ we are really referring to a set of probability function P_α, a vaguness set, for which the inequality holds. Thus, technically, the Bayesian logic employs sets of probabilistic support functions to represent the vagueness in comparative plausibility values for hypotheses.

Observe that if the likelihood ratio values LRⁿ approach 0 as the amount of evidence eⁿ increases, the interval of values for the posterior probability ratio becomes tighter as the upper bound (LRⁿ×r) approaches 0. Furthermore, the absolute degree of support for h_j, P_α[h_j | b·cⁿ·eⁿ], must also approach 0.

This observation is really useful because it can be shown that when h_i·b·cⁿ is true and h_j is empirically distinct from h_i, the continual pursuit of evidence is very likely to result in evidential outcomes eⁿ that (as n increases) yield values of likelihood ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = LRⁿ that approach 0 as the amount of evidence increases. (I'll provide the details of this Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem in section 5.) When that happens, the upper bound on the posterior probability ratio also approaches 0, driving the posterior probability of h_j to approach 0, effectively refuting hypothesis h_j. Thus, false competitors of a true hypothesis will effectively be eliminated by increasing evidence. As this happens, equations (10) and (11) show that the posterior probability P_α[h_i | b·cⁿ·eⁿ] of the true hypothesis h_i approaches 1.

Thus, Bayesian inductive support for hypotheses is a form of eliminative induction, where the evidence effectively refutes false alternatives to the true hypothesis. The eliminative nature of Bayesian evidential support doesn't require precise values for prior probabilities. It only need draw on bounds on comparative plausibility ratios, and these bounds only play a significant role while evidence remains fairly sparse. If the true hypothesis is comparatively plausible (due to plausibility arguments contained in b), then plausibility assessments give it a leg-up over alternatives. If the true hypothesis is comparatively implausible, the plausibility assessments merely slow down the rate at which it comes to dominate its rivals, reflecting the idea that extraordinary hypotheses require extraordinary evidence (or an extraordinary accumulation of evidence) to overcome their initial implausibilities.

Thus, as evidence accumulates, the agent's vague initial plausibility assessments transform into quite sharp posterior probabilities that indicate the strong refutation or support of the various hypotheses. Intuitively this seems quite a reasonable way to represent how evidential support should work.

The various agents in a community may widely disagree over the non-evidential plausiblities of hypotheses. Bayesian inductivists may represent this kind of diversity across the community of agents as a collection of the agents' vagueness sets. Let's call such a collection a diversity set. That is, a diversity set is just a set of support functions P_α that cover the ranges of values for comparative plausibility assessments for pairs of competing hypotheses

q  ≤  P_α[h_j | b] / P_α[h_i | b]  ≤  r

as assessed by the scientific community on the basis of plausibility arguments and considerations (expressed within b).

So, although there may well be disagreement among agents regarding the ranges of comparative prior plausibilities of hypotheses, a probabilistic inductive logic may easily represent this diversity. Furthermore, if accumulating evidence drives the likelihood ratios to extremes, the range of functions in a diversity set will come to near agreement, near 0 or 1, on the values for posterior probabilities of hypotheses. So, not only does such evidence firm up each agent's vague initial plausibilities, it also brings the whole community into agreement on the near refutation of empirically distinct competitors of a true hypothesis.

Under what conditions might the likelihood ratios go to such extremes as evidence accumulates, effectively washing out vagueness and diversity? The Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem (discussed in detail in Section 5) implies that if a true hypothesis disagrees with false alternatives on the likelihoods of possible outcomes for a long enough stream of experiments or observations, then that evidence stream will very probably produce actual outcomes that drive the likelikood ratios of false alternatives as compared to the true hypothesis to approach 0. As this happens, almost any range of prior plausibility assessments will be driven to agreement on the posterior plausibilities for hypotheses. Thus, the accumulating evidence will very probably bring all support functions in the vagueness and diversity sets for a community of agents to near agreement on posterior plausibility values— near 0 for the false competitors, and near 1 for the true hypothesis (or for its disjunction with empirically indistinguishable alternatives).

One more point about prior probabilities and Bayesian convergence should be mentioned here. Some subjectivist versions of Bayesian induction seem to suggest that an agent's prior plausibility assessments for hypotheses should stay fixed once and for all, and that all plausibility updating should be brought about via the likelihoods in accord with Bayes' Theorem. Critics argue that this is unreasonable. The members of a scientific community may quite legitimately revise their (comparative) prior plausibility assessments for hypotheses from time to time as they rethink plausibility arguments and bring new considerations to bear. This seems a natural part of the conceptual development of a science. It turns out that such reassessments of priors poses no difficulty for probabilistic inductive logic as I've described it here. Reassessments may come about by the addition of explicit statements that supplement or modify the background information b, and they may also take the form of (non-Bayesian) transitions to new vagueness sets for individual agents and to new diversity sets for the community. The logic of Bayesian induction (as described here) has nothing to say about what values the prior plausibility assessments for hypotheses should have; and it places no restrictions on how they might change. Provided that the series of reassessments of prior plausibilities doesn't push the prior of the true hypothesis ever nearer to zero, the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem implies that the evidence will very probably bring the posterior probabilities of empirically distinct rivals of the true hypothesis to approach 0 via decreasing likelihood ratios; and as this happens, the posterior probability of the true hypothesis will head towards 1.

Recall that in enumerative inductions the idea is to infer the proportion, or relative frequency, of an attribute in a population from how frequently the attribute occurs in a sample of the population. Examples 1 and 2 at the beginning of the article describe two such inferences. Enumerative induction is only a rather special case of inductive inference. However, such inferences are very common, and so worthy of careful attention. They arise, for example, in the context of polling and in many other cases where a population frequency is estimated from a sample. We will establish conditions under which such inferences give rise to highly objective posterior probabilities, posterior probabilities that are extremely stable over a wide range of reasonable prior plausibility assessments. That is, we will consider all of the inductive support functions in an agent's vagueness set V or in a community's diversity set D. We will see that under some very weak suppositions about the make up of V or of D, a reasonable amount of data will bring all of the support functions in these sets to agree that the posterior degree of support for a particular frequency hypothesis is very close to 1. And, we will see, it is very likely these support functions will converge to agreement on a true hypothesis.

Put more formally, we are asking for what values of p and q does the following inequality hold:

P_α[(m/n)−q< F[A,B] <(m/n)+q   | b · F[A,S]=m/n · Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n]  > p?

It turns out that we need only a very weak supposition about the values of prior probabilities of support functions P_α in vagueness or diversity sets to legitimize such inferences, an supposition that almost always holds in the context of enumerative inductions.

Boundedness Assumption for Estimation:
There is a region R of possible values near the sample frequency m/n (e.g., R is the region between (m/n)−q and (m/n)+q , for some margin of error q of interest) such that no frequency hypothesis outside of region R is overwhelmingly more initially plausible than those frequency hypotheses inside of region R.

What does it mean for no frequency hypothesis outside of region R to be overwhelmingly more initially plausible than those frequency hypotheses inside of region R (where R is some specific region in which the sample frequence, F[A,S]=m/n, lies)? The main idea is that there is some (perhaps very large) bound K on how much more plausible frequency hypotheses outside of region R may be than those frequency hypotheses inside of region R. We state this condition carefully by considering two kinds of cases, depending on whether or not the population B is known to be bounded in size by some specific (perhaps overly large) integer u. (The first case will be simpler because it doesn't suppose that the support functions involved may be characterized by probability density functions, while the second case does suppose this.)

Case 1. Suppose the size of the population B is finite. We need not know how big B is. We merely suppose that for some positive integer u that is at least as large as the size of B, but might well be many times larger, the following condition holds for all support functions P_α in the vagueness or diversity set under consideration.

There is some specific positive factor K (possibly very large, perhaps as large as 1000, or larger) such that for any pair of hypotheses of form F[A,B] = v/u inside region R and of form F[A,B] = w/u outside of region R (where u, v, and w are non-negative integers), the hypothesis outside of region R is no more than K times more plausible than the hypothesis within region R (given plausibility consideration within b)—i.e., for all ratios v/u inside region R and all ratios v/u outside region R, P_α[F[A,B]=w/u | b] / P_α[F[A,B]=v/u | b] ≤ K.

For Case 1 we also assume (as seems reasonable) that in the absence of information about the observed sample frequency, the claim ‘Random[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n’, that the sample is randomly selected and of size n, should be irrelevant to the initial plausibilities of possible population frequencies—i.e. we suppose that P_α[F[A,B]=k/u | Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n · b] = P_α[F[A,B]=k/u | b] for each integer k from 0 through u.

Case 2. Alternatively, suppose that there is no positive integer u at least as large as the size of population B that satisfies the conditions of case 1. But suppose that the prior probabilities of the various competing hypotheses can be represented (at least very nearly) by a probability density function p_α[F[A,B]=r | b]—i.e., for any specific values v and u, the value of P_α[ v < F[A,B] < u | b] = ∫_v^u p_α[F[A,B]=r | b] dr, or at least very nearly so. Then we just need the following condition to be satisfied by all support functions P_α in the vagueness or diversity set under consideration.

There is some specific positive factor K (possibly very large, perhaps as large as 1000, or larger) such that for any pair of hypotheses of form F[A,B] = r inside region R and of form F[A,B] = s outside of region R (where r and s are non-negative real numbers no larger than 1), the value of the probability density function for the hypothesis outside of region R is no more than K times larger than the value of the probability density function for the hypothesis within region R (given plausibility consideration within b), where the density function within region R is never less than some (perhaps very tiny) positive lower bound—i.e., for all values r inside region R and all values s outside region R, p_α[F[A,B]=s | b] / p_α[F[A,B]=r | b] ≤ K, where for all r within region R, p_α[F[A,B]=r | b] ≥ g for some small g > 0.

For Case 2 we also assume (as seems reasonable) that in the absence of information about the observed sample frequency, the claim ‘Random[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n’, that the sample is randomly selected and of size n, should be irrelevant to the initial plausibilities of possible population frequencies—i.e. in particular, we suppose that for each probability density function p_α under consideration, p_α[F[A,B]=q | Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n · b] = p_α[F[A,B]=q | b] for real numbers q from 0 through 1.

When either of these two Cases hold, let us say that for the support functions P_α in the vagueness or diversity sets under consideration, the prior probabilities are K bounded with resprct to region R. Then we have the following theorem about enumerative inductions, which shows that the posterior probability that the true frequency must lie within a small region R around the sample frequency m/n quicky approaches 1 as the sample size n becomes large.

The expression ‘β[R, m+1, n−m+1]’ represents the beta-distribution function with parameters m+1 and n−m+1 evaluated over region R. By definition β[R, m+1, n−m+1] = ∫_R r^m (1−r)^n−m dr / ∫₀¹ r ^m (1−r)^n−m dr. When region R contains an interval around m/n, the value of this function is a fraction that approaches 1 for large n. In a moment we will see some concrete illustrations of the implications of this theorem for specific values of m and n and specific regions R.

The values of the beta-distribution function may be easily computed using a version of the function supplied with most mathematics and spreadsheet programs. The version of the function supplied by such programs usually takes the form BETADIST(x, y, z), which computes the value of the beta distribution from 0 up to to x, and where y and z are the “parameters of the distribution”. For our purposes, where the sample S of n selections from B yields m that exhibit As, these parameters need to be m+1 and n−m+1. So if the region R of interest (wherein the sample frequency m/n lies) is between the values v and u (where v is the lower bound on region R and u is the upper bound on region R), then the program should be asked to compute the value of β[R, m+1, n−m+1] = ∫_v^u r^m (1−r)^n−m dr / ∫₀¹ r ^m (1−r)^n−m dr by having it compute BETADIST[u, m+1, n−m+1]− BETADIST[v, m+1, n−m+1]. So, to have your mathematics or spreadsheet program compute a lower bound on the value of

 P_α[v ≤ F[A,B] ≤ u | b · F[A,S]=m/n · Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n]

for a given upper bound K (on how much more initially plausible it is that the true population frequency lies outside the region between v and u than it is that the true polulation frequency lies inside that region), you may be able to simply paste the following expression into your program and then plug in desired values for K, u, v, m, n in this expression:

1 / (1 + K*((1/(BETADIST(u, m+1, n-m+1)-BETADIST(v, m+1, n-m+1)) - 1))

In many real cases it will not be initially more plausible that the true frequency value lies outside of the region of interest between v and u than that it lies inside that region. In such cases set the value of K to 1. However, you will find that for any moderately large sample size n, this function yields very similar values for all plausible values of K you might try out, even when the values of K are quite large. (We'll see examples of this fact in the computed tables below.)

This theorem implies that for large samples the values of prior probabilities don't matter much. Given such evidence, a vary wide range of inductive support functions P_α will come to agree on high posterior probabilities that the proportion of attribute A in population B is very close to the sample frequency. Thus, all support functions in such vagueness or diversity sets come to near agreement. Let us look at several numerical examples to make clear how strong this result really is.

The first section of this article provided two examples of enumerative inductive inferences. Consider Example 1. Let ‘B’ represent the population of all ravens. Let ‘A’ represent the class of black ravens. Now consider those hypotheses of form ‘F[A,B] = r’ for r in the interval between .99 and 1. This collection of hypotheses includes the claim that “all ravens are black” together with those alternative hypotheses that claim the frequency of being black among ravens is within .01 of 1. The alternatives to these hypotheses are just those that assert ‘F[A,B] = s’ for values of s below .99.

Suppose none of the support functions represented in the vagueness or diversity set under consideration rates the prior plausibility of any of the hypotheses ‘F[A,B] = s’ with s less than .99 to be more than twice as plausible as the hypotheses ‘F[A,B] = r’ for which r is between .99 and 1. That is, suppose, for each P_α in the vagueness or diversity set under consideration, the prior plausibility P_α[F[A,B] = s | b] for hypotheses with s below .99 is never more than K = 2 times greater than the prior plausibility P_α[F[A,B] = r | b] for hypotheses with r between .99 and 1. Then, on the evidence of 400 ravens selected randomly with respect to color, the theorem yields the following bound for all P_α in the vagueness or diversity set:

  P_α[F[A,B] >.99 | b · F[A,S] = 1 · Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S] = 400]  ≥  .9651.

The following table describes similar results for other upper bounds K on values of prior probability ratios and other sample sizes n:

Table 1: Values of lower bound p on the posterior probability

m/n = 1 F[A,B] > .99		Sample-Size = n (number of As in Sample of Bs = m = n)
Prior Ratio K ↓		400	800	1600	3200
1		0.9822	0.9997	1.0000	1.0000
2		0.9651	0.9994	1.0000	1.0000
5		0.9170	0.9984	1.0000	1.0000
10		0.8468	0.9968	1.0000	1.0000
100		0.3560	0.9691	1.0000	1.0000
1,000		0.0524	0.7581	0.9999	1.0000
10,000		0.0055	0.2386	0.9990	1.0000
100,000		0.0006	0.0304	0.9898	1.0000
1,000,000		0.0001	0.0031	0.9068	1.0000
10,000,000		0.0000	0.0003	0.4931	1.0000

P_α[F[A,B]>.99 | b·F[A,S]=1 ·Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S]=n] ≥ p, for a range of Sample-Sizes n (from 400 to 3200), when the prior probability of any specific frequency hypothesis outside the region between .99 and 1 is no more than K times more than the lowest prior probability for any specific frequency hypothesis inside of the region between .99 and 1.

(All probabilities with entries ‘1.0000’ in this table and the next actually have values slightly less than one, but nearly equal 1.0000 to four significant decimal places.)

To see what the table tells us, consider the third to last row. It represents what happens when a vagueness or diversity set contains at least some support functions that assign prior probabilities (i.e. prior plausibilities) nearly one hundred thousand times higher to some hypotheses asserting frequencies not between .99 and 1 than it assigns to hypotheses asserting frequencies between .99 and 1. The table shows that even in such cases, a random sample of 1600 black ravens will, nevertheless, pull the posterior plausibility level that “the true frequency is above .99” to a value above .9898, for every support function in the set. And if the vagueness or diversity set contains support functions that assign even more extreme priors, say, priors that are nearly ten million times higher for some hypotheses asserting frequencies below .99 than for hypotheses within .99 of 1 (the table's last row), this poses no great problem for convergence-to-agreement. A random sample of 3200 black ravens will yield posterior probabilities (i.e. posterior plausibilities) indistinguishable from 1 for the claim that “more than 99% of all ravens are black.”

Strong support can be gotten for an even narrower range of hypotheses about the percentage of black birds among the ravens. But a larger sample size is needed for this. For an additional example, see the supplementary document

Tighter Bounds on the Margin of Error.

Now consider the second example of an enumerative induction provided at the beginning of this article, involving the poll about the presidential preferences of voters. The posterior probabilities for this example follow a pattern similar to that of the first example. Let ‘B’ represent the class of all registered voters on February 20, 2004, and let ‘A’ represent those who prefer Kerry to Bush. In sample S (randomly drawn from B with respect to A) consisting of 400 voters, 248 report preference for Kerry over Bush—i.e., F[A,B] = 248/400 = .62. Suppose, as seems reasonable, that none of the support functions in the vagueness or diversity set under consideration rates the hypotheses ‘F[A,B] = r’ for values of r outside the interval .62±.05 as more initially plausible than they rate alternative frequency hypotheses having values of r inside this interval. That is, suppose, for each P_α under consideration, the prior probabilities P_α[F[A,B] = s | b] when s is not within .62±.05 is never more than K = 1 times as great as the prior probabilities P_α[F[A,B] = r | b] for hypotheses having r within .62±.05. Then, the theorem yields the following lower bound on the posterior plausibility ratings, for all P_α in the vagueness or diversity set under consideration:

P_α[.57 < F[A,B] < .67   | b · F[A,S]=.62 · Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S]=400]  ≥  .9614.

The following table gives similar results for other sample sizes, and for upper bounds on ratios of prior probabilities that may be much larger than 1. In addition, this table shows what happens when we tighten up the interval around the frequency hypotheses being supported to .62±.025—i.e., it shows the bounds p on support for the hypothesis .595 < F[A,B] < .645 as well:

Table 2: Values of lower bound p on the posterior probability

m/n = .62	F[A,B] = m/n ± q		Sample-Size = n (number of As in Sample of Bs = m: where m/n = .62)
Prior Ratio K ↓	q = .05 or .025		400 (248)	800 (496)	1600 (992)	3200 (1984)	6400 (3968)	12800 (7936)
1	.05 → .025 →		0.9614 0.6982	0.9965 0.8554	1.0000 0.9608	1.0000 0.9964	1.0000 1.0000	1.0000 1.0000
2	.05 → .025 →		0.9256 0.5364	0.9930 0.7474	0.9999 0.9246	1.0000 0.9929	1.0000 0.9999	1.0000 1.0000
5	.05 → .025 →		0.8327 0.3163	0.9827 0.5420	0.9998 0.8306	1.0000 0.9825	1.0000 0.9998	1.0000 1.0000
10	.05 → .025 →		0.7133 0.1879	0.9661 0.3717	0.9996 0.7103	1.0000 0.9656	1.0000 0.9996	1.0000 1.0000
100	.05 → .025 →		0.1992 0.0226	0.7402 0.0559	0.9963 0.1969	1.0000 0.7371	1.0000 0.9962	1.0000 1.0000
1,000	.05 → .025 →		0.0243 0.0023	0.2217 0.0059	0.9639 0.0239	1.0000 0.2190	1.0000 0.9637	1.0000 1.0000
10,000	.05 → .025 →		0.0025 0.0002	0.0277 0.0006	0.7277 0.0024	0.9999 0.0273	1.0000 0.7261	1.0000 0.9999
100,000	.05 → .025 →		0.0002 0.0000	0.0028 0.0001	0.2109 0.0002	0.9994 0.0028	1.0000 0.2096	1.0000 0.9994
1,000,000	.05 → .025 →		0.0000 0.0000	0.0003 0.0000	0.0260 0.0000	0.9940 0.0003	1.0000 0.0258	1.0000 0.9943
10,000,000	.05 → .025 →		0.0000 0.0000	0.0000 0.0000	0.0027 0.0000	0.9433 0.0000	1.0000 0.0026	1.0000 0.9457

P_α[.62−q < F[A,B] < .62+q | F[A,S] = .62 · Rnd[S,B,A] · Size[S] = n] ≥ p, for two values of q (.05 and .025) and a range of Sample-Sizes n (from 400 to 12800), when the prior probability of any specific frequency hypothesis outside of .62 ± q is no more than K times more than the lowest prior probability for any specific frequency hypothesis inside of .62 ± q.

Notice that even if the vagueness or diversity set includes prior plausibilities nearly ten million times higher for hypotheses asserting frequency values outside of .62±.025 than for hypotheses asserting frequencies within .62±.025, a random sample of 12800 registered voters will, nevertheless, bring about a posterior plausibility value greater than .9457 for the claim that “the true frequency of preference for Kerry over Bush among all registered voters is within .62±.025”, for all support functions P_α in the set.

However, there is such a CoA result close at hand. It is a Weak Law of Large Numbers result that establishes that each frequency hypothesis of form ‘F[A,B] = r’ implies, via direct inference likelihoods, that randomly selected sample data is highly likely to result in sample frequencies very close to the value r that it claims to be the true frequency. Of course each frequency hypothesis says that the sample frequency will be near its own frequency value; but only the true hypothesis says this truthfully. Add this result to the previous theorem and we get that, for large sample sizes, it is very likely that a sample frequency will occur that yields a very high degree of support for the true hypothesis. Thus the CoA is satisfied.

Here is the needed result.

Here Φ[x] is the area under the Standard Normal Distribution up to point x. The first equality is a version of the binomial theorem. The approximation of the binomial formula by the normal distribution is guaranteeed by the Central Limit Theorem. This approximation is very close for n near 20, and gets extremely close as n gets larger.

Notice that the degree of support probability in this theorem is a direct inference likelihood—all support functions should agree on these values.^[17]

This Weak Law result together with the Simple Estimation Theorem yields the promised CoA result: for large sample sizes, it is very likely that a sample frequency will occur that has a value very near the true frequency; and whenever such a sample frequency does occur, it yields a very high degree of support for the true frequency hypothesis.

This result only applies to enumerative inductions. In the next section we establish a CoA result that applies much more generally. It applies to the inductive support of hypotheses in any context where competing hypotheses are empirically distinct enough to disagree, at least a little, on the likelihoods of possible evidential outcomes.

The theorem itself does not require the full apparatus of Bayesian probability functions. It draws only on likelihoods. Neither the statement of the theorem nor its proof employ prior probabilities of any kind. Likelihoodists and Bayesian inductivists agree that when the ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] approach 0 for increasing n, the evidence goes strongly against h_j as compared to h_i. So even a likelihoodist who eschews the use of Bayesian prior probabilities may embrace this result.

For Bayesians, the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem further implies the likely convergence to agreement near 0 of the posterior probabilities of false competitors of a true hypothesis. When the ratios P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] approach 0 for increasing n, the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem, Equation 9, says that the posterior probability of h_j must also approach 0 as evidence accumulates, regardless of the value of its prior probability. So, support functions in collections representing vague prior plausibilities for an individual agent (i.e., a vagueness set) and representing the diverse range of priors for a community of agents (i.e., a diversity set) will very likely come to agree on the near 0 posterior probability of empirically distinct false rivals of a true hypothesis. And as the posterior probabilities of false competitors fall, the posterior probability of the true hypothesis heads towards 1. Thus, the theorem establishes that the inductive logic of probabilistic support functions satisfies the Criterion of Adequacy (CoA).

The Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem overcomes many of the objections raised by critics of Bayesian convergence results. First, this theorem does not employ second-order probabilities; it says noting about the probability of a probability. It only concerns the probability of a particular disjunctive sentence that expresses a disjunction of various possible sequences of experimental or observational outcomes. The theorem does not require evidence to consist of sequences of events that, according to the hypothesis, are identically distributed (like repeated tosses of a die). Although the result is most easily expressed in cases where the sequence of outcomes are probabilistically independent relative to each hypothesis, a version of the theorem also holds when the individual outcomes of the evidence stream are not probabilistically independent on the hypotheses. The result does not rely on countable additivity. And the explicit lower bounds it provides on convergence means that there is no need to wait for the infinte long run before convergence occurs (as some critics seem to think).

It is sometimes claimed that Bayesian convergence results only work when an agent locks in values for the prior probabilities of hypotheses once and for all, and updates posterior probabilities from there only by conditioning on evidence via Bayes Theorem. The Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem, however, applies even if agents revise their prior probability assessments over time. Such non-Bayesian shifts from one support function (or vagueness set) to another may arise from new plausibility arguments or from reassessments of the strengths of old ones. The Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem itself only involves the values of likelihoods. So, provided such reassessments don't push the prior probability of the true hypothesis towards 0 too rapidly, the theorem implies that the posterior probabilities of each empirically distinct false competitor will very probably approach 0 as evidence increases.^[18]

For a given sequence of n experiments or observations cⁿ, consider the set of those possible sequences of outcomes that would result in likelihood ratios for h_j over h_i that are less than some chosen small number ε > 0. This set is represented by the expression:

{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] < ε}.

Placing the disjunction symbol ‘∨’ in front of this expression yields an expression:

∨{ eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] < ε},

that we'll use to represent the disjunction of all outcome sequences in this set. So,

∨{ eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] < ε}

is just a particular sentence that says, in effect, “one of the sequences of outcomes of the first n experiments or observations will occur that makes the likelihood ratio for h_j over h_i less than ε.”

The Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem says that under certain conditions (covered in detail below), the likelihood of a disjunctive sentence of this sort, given that ‘h_i·b·cⁿ’ is true,

P[∨{ eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] < ε}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ],

must be at least 1−(ψ/n), for some explicitly calculable term ψ. Thus, the true hypothesis h_i probabilistically implies that as the amount of evidence, n, increases, it becomes highly likely (as close to 1 as you please) that one of the outcome sequences eⁿ will occur that yields a likelihood ratio P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] less than ε; and this holds for any specific value of ε you may choose. As this happens, the posterior probability of h_i's false competitor, h_j, must approach 0, as required by the Ratio Form of Bayes' Theorem, Equation 9.

The term ψ in the lower bound of this probability depends on a measure of the empirical distinctness of the hypotheses for the proposed sequence of experiments and observations. To specify this measure we need to contemplate the collection of possible outcomes of each experiment or observation. So, consider some sequence of experimental or observational conditions described by sentences c₁,c₂,…,c_n. Corresponding to each condition c_k there will be some range of possible alternative outcomes. Let O_k = {o_k1,o_k2,…,o_kw} be a set of statements describing the alternative possible outcomes for condition c_k. (The number of alternative outcomes will usually differ for distinct experiments c₁,…,c_n; so, the value of w depends on c_k.) For each hypothesis h_j, the alternative outcomes of c_k in O_k are mutually exclusive and exhaustive, so we have:

P[oku·okv | hj·b·ck] = 0

and

w ∑ u = 1

P[oku | hj·b·ck] =1.

We now let expressions like ‘e_k’ act as variables that range over the possible outcomes of c_k—i.e., e_k ranges over the members of O_k. As before, ‘cⁿ’ denotes the conjunction of the first n test conditions, (c₁·c₂·…·c_n), and ‘eⁿ’ represents possible sequences of corresponding outcomes, (e₁·e₂·…·e_n). Let's use the expression ‘Eⁿ’ to represent the set of all possible outcome sequences that may result from the sequence of conditions cⁿ. So, for each hypothesis h_j (including h_i), ∑_eⁿ∈Eⁿ P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] = 1.

Everything introduced in this subsection is mere notational convention. No substantive suppositions (other than the axioms of probability theory) have yet been introducted. The version of the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem I'll present below does, however, draw on one substantive supposition, although a rather weak one. The next subsection will discuss that supposition in detail.

When these two conditions hold, the likelihood for an evidence sequence may be decomposed into the product of the likelihoods for individual experiments or observations. To see how the two independence conditions affect the decomposition, first consider the following formula, which holds even when neither independence condition is satisfied:

(12)

P[en | hj·b·cn] =

n Π k = 1

P[ek | hj·b·cn·ek−1].

When condition-independence holds, the likelihood of the whole evidence stream parses into a product of likelihoods that probabilistically depend on only past observation conditions and their outcomes. They do not depend on the conditions for other experiments whose outcomes are not yet specified. Here is the formula:

(13)

P[en | hj·b·cn] =

n Π k = 1

P[ek | hj·b·ck· (ck−1·ek−1)].

Finally, whenever both independence conditions are satisfied we have the following relationship between the likelihood of the evidence stream and the likelihoods of individual experiments or observations:

(14)

P[en | hj·b·cn] =

n Π k = 1

P[ek | hj·b·ck].

(For proofs of Equations 12-14, see the supplementary document: Immediate Consequences of Independent Evidence Conditions.)

In scientific contexts the evidence can almost always be divided into parts that satisfy both clauses of the Independent Evidence Condition with respect to each alternative hypothesis. To see why, let us consider each independence condition more carefully.

Condition-independence says that the mere addition of a new observation condition c_k+1, without specifying one of its outcomes, does not alter the likelihood of the outcomes e^k of other experiments c^k. To appreciate the significance of this condition, imagine what it would be like if it were violated. Suppose hypothesis h_j is some statistical theory, say, for example, a quantum theory of superconductivity. The conditions expressed in c^k describe a number of experimental setups, perhaps conducted in numerous labs throughout the world, that test a variety of aspects of the theory (e.g., experiments that test electrical conductivity in different materials at a range of temperatures). An outcome sequence e^k describes the results of these experiments. The violation of condition-independence would mean that merely adding to h_j·b·c^k a statement c_k+1 describing how an additional experiment has been set up, but with no mention of its outcome, changes how likely the evidence sequence e^k is taken to be. What (h_j·b) says via likelihoods about the outcomes e^k of experiments c^k differs as a result of merely supplying a description of another experimental arrangement, c_k+1. Condition-independence, when it holds, rules out such strange effects.

Result-independence says that the description of previous test conditions together with their outcomes is irrelevant to the likelihoods of outcomes for additional experiments. If this condition were widely violated, then in order to specify the most informed likelihoods for a given hypothesis one would need to include information about volumes of past observations and their outcomes. What a hypothesis says about future cases would depend on how past cases have gone. Such dependence had better not happen on a large scale. Otherwise, the hypothesis would be fairly useless, since its empirical import in each specific case would depend on taking into account volumes of past observational and experimental results. However, even if such dependencies occur, provided they are not too pervasive, result-independence can be accommodated rather easily by packaging each collection of result-dependent data together, treating it like a single extended experiment or observation. The result-independence condition will then be satisfied by letting each term ‘c_k’ in the statement of the independence condition represent a conjunction of test conditions for a collection of result-dependent tests, and by letting each term ‘e_k’ (and each term ‘o_ku’) stand for a conjunction of the corresponding result-dependent outcomes. Thus, by packaging result-dependent data together in this way, the result-independence condition is satisfied by those (conjunctive) statements that describe the separate, result-independent chunks.^[19]

The version of the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem we will examine depends only on the Independent Evidence Conditions (together with the axioms of probability theory). It draws on no other assumptions. Indeed, an even more general version of the theorem can be established that draws on neither of the Independent Evidence Conditions. However, the Independent Evidence Conditions will be satisfied in almost all scientific contexts, so little will be lost by assuming them. (And the presentation will run more smoothly if we side-step the added complications needed to explain the more general result.)

From this point on let us assume that the following versions of the Independent Evidence Conditions hold.

We now have all that is needed to begin to state the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem.

The first part of the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem applies to that part of the total stream of evidence (i.e. that subsequence of the total evidence stream) on which hypothesis h_j fails to be fully outcome-compatible with hypothesis h_i; the second part of the theorem applies to the remaining part of the total stream of evidence, that subsequence of the total evidence stream on which h_j is fully outcome-compatible with h_i for each experiment and observation. It turns out that these two kinds of cases must be treated differently. (This is due to the way in which the expected information content of for distinguishing between the two hypotheses will be measured for experiments and observations that are fully outcome compatible; this measure of information content blows up ( becomes infinite) for experiments and observations that fail to be fully outcome compatible). Thus, the following part of the convergence theorem applies to just that part of the total stream of evidence that consists of experiments and observations that fail to be fully outcome compatible for the pair of hypotheses involved. Here, then, is the first part of the theorem.

In other words, we only suppose that for each of m observations, c_k, (drawn from the total stream of all n observations, cⁿ), h_i says observation c_k has at least a small likelihood δ of producing one of the outcomes o_ku that h_j says is impossible. If the number m of such experiments or observations is large enough (or if the lower bound δ on the likelihoods of getting such outcomes is large enough), and if h_i (together with b·cⁿ) is true, then it is highly likely that one of the outcomes held to be impossible by h_j will actually occur. If one of these outcomes does occur, then the likelihood ratio for h_j as compared to over h_i will become 0. According to Bayes' Theorem, when this happen, h_j is absolutely refuted by the evidence—its posterior probability becomes 0.

The Falsification Theorem is very commonsensical. First, notice that if there is a crucial experiment in the evidence stream, the theorem is completely obvious. That is, suppose for the specific experiment c_k (in evidence stream cⁿ) there are two incompatible possible outcomes o_kv and o_ku such that P[o_kv | h_j·b·c_k] = 1 and P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] = 1. Then, clearly, P[∨{ o_ku: P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] = 0} | h_i·b·c_k] = 1, since o_ku is one of the o_ku such that P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] = 0. So where there is a crucial experiment available, the theorem applies with m = 1 and δ = 1.

The theorem is equally commonsensical for cases where no crucial experiment is available. To see what it says in such cases, consider an example. Let h_i be some theory that implies a specific rate of proton decay, but a rate so low that there is only a very small probability that any particular proton will decay in a given year. Consider an alternative theory h_j that implies that protons never decay. If h_i is true, then for a persistent enough sequence of observations (i.e., if proper detectors can be built and trillions of protons kept under observation for long enough), eventually a proton decay will almost surely be detected. When this happens, the likelihood ratio becomes 0. Thus, the posterior probability of h_j becomes 0.

It is instructive to plug some specific values into the formula given by the Falsification Theorem, to see what the convergence rate might look like. For example, the theorem tells us that if we compare any pair of hypotheses h_i and h_j on an evidence stream cⁿ that contains at least m = 19 observations or experiments having δ ≥ .10 for the likelihood of yielding a falsifying outcome, then the likelihood (on h_i·b·cⁿ) of obtaining an outcome sequence eⁿ that yields likelihood-ratio P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = 0, will be at least as large as 1−(1−.1)¹⁹ = .865. (The reader is invited to try other values of δ and m as well.)

A comment about the need for and usefulness of such convergence theorems is in order, now that we’ve seen one. Given some specific pair of scientific hypotheses h_i and h_j one may directly compute the likelihood, given (h_i·b·cⁿ), that a proposed sequence of experiments or observations cⁿ will result in one of the sequences of outcomes that yield low likelihood ratios. So, given a specific pair of hypotheses and a proposed sequence of experiments, we don't need a general Convergence Theorem to tell us the likelihood of obtaining refuting evidence. The specific hypotheses h_i and h_j tell us this themselves. They tell us the likelihood of obtaining each specific outcome stream, including those that refute the competitor or produce a very small likelihood ratio for it. Furthermore, after we've actually performed an experiment and recorded its outcome, all that matters is the actual ratio of likelihoods for that outcome. Convergence theorems become moot.

The point of the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem (both the Falsification Theorem and the part of the theorem still to come) is to assure us in advance of the consideration of any specific pair of hypotheses that if the possible evidence streams that test hypotheses have certain characteristics which reflect the empirical distinctness of the hypotheses, then it is highly likely that one of the sequences of outcomes will occur that yields a very small likelihood ratio. These theorems provide relatively meager, but finite lower bounds on how quickly such convergence is likely to be. Thus, they show that the CoA is satisfied in advance of our using the logic to test specific pairs of hypotheses against one another.

Hypotheses whose connection with the evidence is entirely statistical in nature will inevitably be fully outcome-compatible on the entire evidence stream. So, evidence streams of this kind are undoubtedly much more common in practice than those containing possibly falsifying outcomes. Furthermore, whenever an entire stream of evidence contains some mixture of experiments and observations on which the hypotheses are not fully outcome compatible along with others on which they are fully outcome compatible, we may treat the experiments and observations for which full outcome compatiblity holds as a seperate subsequence of the entire evidence stream, to see the likely impact of that part of the evidence in producing values for likelihood ratios.

To cover evidence streams (or subsequences of evidence streams) consisting entirely of experiments or observations on which h_j is fully outcome-compatible with hypothesis h_i we will first need to identify a useful way to measure the degree to which hypotheses are empirically distinct from one another on such evidence. Consider some particular sequence of outcomes eⁿ that results from observations cⁿ. The likelihood ratio P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] itself measures the extent to which the outcome sequence distinguishes between h_i and h_j. But as a measure of the power of evidence to distinguish among hypotheses, raw likelihood ratios provide a rather lopsided scale, a scale that ranges from 0 to infinity with the midpoint, where eⁿ doesn't distinguish at all between h_i and h_j, at 1. So, rather than using raw likelihood ratios to measure the ability of eⁿ to distinguish between hypotheses, it proves more useful to employ a symmetric measure. The logarithm of the likelihood ratio provides such a measure.

So, we'll measure the Quality of the Information an outcome would yield in distinguishing between two hypotheses as the base-2 logarithm of the likelihood ratio. This is clearly a symmetric measure of the outcome's evidential strength at distinguishing between the two hypotheses. On this measure hypotheses h_i and h_j assign the same likelihood value to a given outcome o_ku just when QI[o_ku | h_i/h_j | b·c_k] = 0. Thus, QI measures information on a logarithmic scale that is symmetric about the natural no-information midpoint, 0. This measure is set up so that positive information favors h_i over h_j, and negative information favors h_j over h_i.

Given the Independent Evidence Assumptions with respect to each hypothesis, it's easy to show that the QI for a sequence of outcomes is just the sum of the QIs of the individual outcomes in the sequence:

(15)

QI[en | hi/hj | b·cn] =

n ∑ k = 1

QI[ek | hi/hj | b·ck].

Probability theorists measure the expected value of a quantity by first multiplying each of its possible values by their probabilities of occurring, and then summing these products. Thus, the expected value of QI is given by the following formula:

The EQI of an experiment or observation is the Expected Quality of its Information for distinguishing h_i from h_j when h_i is true. It is a measure of the expected evidential strength of the possible outcomes of an experiment or observation at distinguishing between the hypotheses when h_i (together with b·c) is true. Whereas QI measures the ability of each particular outcome or sequence of outcomes to empirically distinguish hypotheses, EQI measures the tendency of experiments or observations to produce distinguishing outcomes. It can be shown that EQI tracks empirical distinctness in a very precise way. We return to this in a moment.

It is easily seen that the EQI for a sequence of observations cⁿ is just the sum of the EQIs of the individual observations c_k in the sequence:

(16)

EQI[cn | hi/hj | b]

=

n ∑ k = 1

EQI[ck | hi/hj | b].

(For proof see the supplementary document Proof that the EQI for cⁿ is the sum of the EQI for the individual c_k.)

This suggests that it may be useful to average the values of the EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] over the number of observations n to obtain a measure of the average expected quality of the information among the experiments and observations that make up the evidence stream cⁿ.

It turns out that the value of EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] cannot be less than 0; and it will be greater just in case h_i is empirically distinct from h_j on at least one outcome o_ku—i.e., just in case it is empirically distinct in the sense that P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] ≠ P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k]. The same goes for the average, EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b].

In fact, the more finely one partitions the outcome space O_k = {o_k1,…,o_kv,…,o_kw} into distinct outcomes that differ on likelihood ratio values, the larger EQI becomes.^[20] This shows that EQI tracks empirical distinctness in a precise way. The importance of the Non-negativity of EQI result for the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem will become clear in a moment.

We are now in a position to state the second part of the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem. It applies to all evidence streams not containing possibly falsifying outcomes for h_j when h_i holds—i.e., it applies to all evidence streams for which h_j is fully outcome-compatible with h_i on each c_k in the stream.

This theorem provides sufficient conditions for the likely refutation of false alternatives via exceeding small likelihood ratios. The conditions under which this happens characterize the degree to which the hypotheses involved are empirically distinct from one another. The theorem says that when these conditions are met, according to hypothesis h_i (taken together with b·cⁿ), the likelihood is near 1 that that one of the outcome sequence eⁿ will occur for which the likelihood ratio is smaller than ε (for any value of ε you may choose). The likelihood of getting such an evidential outcome eⁿ is quite coles to 1—i.e. no more than the amount (1/n) × (log γ)² / (EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b] + (log ε)/n)² below 1. (Notice that this amount below 1 goes to 0 as n increases.)

It turns out that in almost every case (for almost any pair of hypotheses) the actual likelihood of obtaining such evidence (i.e. evidence that has a likelihood ratio value less than ε) will be much closer to 1 than this factor indicates.^[21] Thus, the theorem provides an overly cautious lower bound on the likelihood of obtaining small likelihood ratios. It shows that the larger the value of EQI for an evidence stream, the more likely that stream is to produce a sequence of outcomes that yield a very small likelihood ratio value. But even if EQI remains quite small, a long enough evidence stream, n, of such low-grade evidence will, nevertheless, almost surely produce an outcome sequence having a very small likelihood ratio value.^[22]

Notice that the antecedent condition of the theorem, that “either P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] = 0 or P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] / P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k]  ≥ γ, for some γ > 0 but less than 1/e² (≈ .135)”, does not favor hypothesis h_i over h_j in any way. The condition only rules out the possibility that some outcomes might furnish extremely strong evidence against h_j relative to h_i—by making P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] = 0 or by making P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] / P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] less than some quite small γ. This condition is only needed because our measure of evidential distinguishability, QI, blows up when the ratio P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] / P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] is extremely small. Furthermore, this condition is really no restriction at all on possible experiments or observations. If c_k has some possible outcome sentence o_ku that would make P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] / P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k]  < γ (for a given small γ of interest), one may disjunctively lump o_ku together with some other outcome sentence o_kv for c_k. Then, the antecedent condition of the theorem will be satisfied, but with the sentence ‘(o_ku ∨ o_kv)’ treated as a single outcome. It can be proved that the only effect of such “disjunctive lumping” is to make EQI smaller than it would otherwise be (whereas larger values of EQI are more desirable). If the too strongly refuting disjunct o_ku actually occurs when the experiment or observation c_k is conducted, all the better, since the result is to yield a likelihood ratio P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] / P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] smaller than γ on that particular evidential outcome. We merely failed to take this more strongly refuting possibility into account when computing our lower bound on the likelihood that refutation via likelihood ratios would occur.

The point of the two Convergence Theorems explored in this section is to assure us, in advance of the consideration of any specific pair of hypotheses, that if the possible evidence streams that test them have certain characteristics which reflect their evidential distinguishability, it is highly likely that outcomes yielding small likelihood ratios will result. These theorems provide finite lower bounds on how quickly convergence is likely to occur, bounds that show one need not wait for convergence through some infinitely long run. Indeed, for any evidence sequence on which the probability distributions are at all well behaved, the actual likelihood of obtaining outcomes that yield small likelihood ratio values will inevitably be much higher than the lower bounds given by Theorems 1 and 2.

In sum, according to Theorems 1 and 2, each hypothesis h_i says, via likelihoods, that given enough observations, it is very likely to dominate its empirically distinct rivals in a contest of likelihood ratios. The true hypothesis speaks truthfully about this, and its competitors lie. Even a sequence of observations with an extremely low average expected quality of information is very likely to do the job if that evidential sequence is long enough. Thus (by Equation 9), as evidence accumulates, the degree of support for false hypotheses will very probably approach 0, indicating that they are probably false; and as this happens, (by Equations 10 and 11) the degree of support for the true hypothesis will approach 1, indicating its probable truth. Thus, the Criterion of Adequacy (CoA) is satisfied.

Recall why agreement, or near agreement, on precise values for likelihoods is so important to the scientific enterprise. To the extent that members of a scientific community disagree on the likelihoods, they disagree about the empirical content of their hypotheses, about what each hypothesis says about how the world is likely to be. This can lead to disagreement about which hypotheses are refuted or supported by a given body of evidence. Similarly, to the extent that the values of likelihoods are only vaguely implied by hypotheses as understood by an individual agent, that agent may be unable to determine which of several hypotheses is refuted or supported by a given body of evidence.

We have seen, however, that the values of individual likelihoods are not what is most crucial to the way evidence impacts hypotheses. Rather, as Equations 9-11 show, it is ratios of likelihoods that do the heavy lifting. So, even if two support functions P_α and P_β disagree on the values of individual likelihoods, they may, nevertheless, largely agree on the refutation or support that accrues to various rival hypotheses, provided that the following condition is satisfied:

When this condition holds, the evidence will support h_i over h_j according to P_α just in case it does so for P_β as well, although the strength of support may differ. Furthermore, the rate at which the likelihood ratios increase or decrease on a stream of evidence may differ for the two support functions, but the impact of the cumulative evidence should ultimately affect their refutation or support in much the same way.

When likelihoods are vague or diverse, we may take the approach we employed for vague and diverse prior plausibility assessments. We may extend the vagueness sets for individual agents to include a collection of inductive support functions that cover the range of values for likelihood ratios of evidence claims that the hypotheses apparently support (as well as covering the ranges of prior comparative support strengths for hypotheses due to plausibility arguments within b). Similarly, we may extend the diversity sets for communities of agents to include support functions that cover the ranges of likelihood ratio values (along with ranges of prior comparative support strengths for hypotheses) drawn from the vagueness sets of members of the scientific community.

This broading of vagueness and diversity sets to accommodate vague and diverse likelihood values makes no trouble for the convergence to truth results for hypotheses. For, provided that the Directional Agreement Condition is satisfied by all support functions in an extended vagueness or diversity set under consideration, the Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem applies to the whole range of support functions in that set. The the proof of the theorem doesn't depend on the supposition that likelihoods are objective or have intersubjectively agreed values. It applies to each individual support function P_α. The only problem with applying this result across a range of support functions is that when their values for likelihoods differ, function P_α may disagree with P_β on which of the hypotheses is favored by a given sequence of evidence. That can happen because different support functions may represent the evidential import of hypotheses differently, by specifying different likelihood values for the very same evidence claims. So, an evidence stream that favors h_i according to P_α may instead favor h_j according to P_β. However, when the Directional Agreement Condition holds for a given collection of support functions, this cannot happen. Directional Agreement means that the evidential import of hypotheses is similar enough for P_α and P_β that a sequence of outcomes may favor a hypothesis according to P_α only if it does so for P_β as well.

Thus, when the Directional Agreement Condition holds for all support functions in a vagueness or diversity set extended to include vague or diverse likelihoods, if enough evidentially distinguishing experiments or observations can be performed, all support functions in the extended vagueness or diversity set will very probably come to agree that the likelihood ratios for empirically distinct false competitors of a true hypothesis are extremely small. As that happens, the community comes to agree on the refutation of these competitors, and the true hypothesis rises to the top of the heap.^[25]

What if the true hypothesis has evidentially equivalent rivals? Their posterior probabilities must rise as well. In that case we are only assured that the disjunction of the true hypothesis with its evidentially equivalent rivals will be driven to 1 as evidence lays low its evidentially distinct rivals. The true hypothesis will itself approach 1 only if either it has no evidentially equivalent rivals, or whatever equivalent rivals it has are laid low by plausibility arguments of the kind that don't depend on the evidential likelihoods.

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Other Internet Resources

• Confirmation and Induction. Really nice overview by Franz Huber on the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
• Inductive Logic, (in PDF), by Branden Fitelson, Philosophy of Science: An Encyclopedia, (J. Pfeifer and S. Sarkar, eds.), Routledge. An extensive encyclopedia article on inductive logic.
• Teaching Theory of Knowledge: Probability and Induction. A very extensive outline of issues in Probability and Induction, each topic accompanied by a list of relevant books and articles (without links), compiled by Brad Armendt and Martin Curd.
• Probabilistic Confirmation Theory and Bayesian Reasoning. An annotated bibliography of influential works compiled by Timothy McGrew.
• Sherlock Holmes and Probabilistic Induction, by Soshichi Uchii (Philosophy and History of Science, University of Kyoto)
• Bayesian Networks Without Tears, (in PDF), by Eugene Charniak (Computer Science and Cognitive Science, Brown University). An introductory article on Bayesian inference.
• Miscellany of Works on Probabilistic Thinking. A collection of on-line articles on Subjective Probability and probabilistic reasoning by Richard Jeffrey and by several other philosophers writing on related issues.
• Fitelson's course on Confirmation Theory. Main page of Branden Fitelson's course on Confirmation Theory. The Syllabus provides an extensive list of links to readings. The Notes, Handouts, & Links page has Fitelson's weekly course notes and some links to useful internet resources on confirmation theory.
• Fitelson's course on Probability and Induction. Main page of Branden Fitelson's course on Probability and Induction. The Syllabus provides an extensive list of links to readings on the subject. The Notes & Handouts page has Fitelson's powerpoint slides for each of his lectures and some links to handouts for the course. The Links page contains links to some useful internet resources.

Related Entries

Bayes' Theorem | epistemology: Bayesian | probability, interpretations of

Acknowledgments

Thanks to Jim Joyce and Edward Zalta for many valuable comments and suggestions. The editors and author would also like to thank Greg Stokley for carefully reading the entry and identifying several typographical errors.